1. The introductions to Bloch’s thought are Geoghegan 1996; Holz 1975; Hudson 1982; Münster 1982; Schmidt 1985.

2. “Primarily, everybody lives in the future, because they strive, past things only come later, and as yet genuine present is almost never there at all” (Bloch 1954-59 [1986a: 4]).

3. On Bloch’s relations to various philosophers and philosophical traditions see, e.g.: Bensaïd 2016; Boldyrev 2014; Deuber-Mankowsky 2002; Dubbels 2011; Gekle 1990; Hindrichs 1994; Jay 1984; Kosnoski 2011; Löwy 1988 [1992]; Marchesoni 2014; Moir 2019a; Pelletier 2009, 2015, 2019; Schiller 1991; Ujma 1995.

4. So, if Bloch’s “style prefigures utopia in its imaginative brio, it also does so in its obscurity” (Eagleton 2015: 91).

5. Benjamin could read in The Spirit of Utopia the invocation of “desperate, again and again aborted prophecy of [Jewish] messianism [that] needs our actuality”. (GA 16: 332, translation mine).

6. “Not all people exist in the same Now” (Bloch 1935 [1991: 97]).

7. Ironically, Bloch very soon could experience this misuse himself, when in the 1930s a Nazi-oriented student became inspired by his Spirit of Utopia. Even more ironically, it was this student who helped transfer the manuscript of Heritage of Our Times to Switzerland (K. Bloch 1981: 82f.).

8. These ideas emerge today in the political philosophy of recognition trying to rethink the opportunities of practical moral progress in the times of hopelessness (Honneth 2017).

9. “Ich bin. Aber ich habe mich nicht. Darum werden wir erst”. (“I am. But I do not have myself. Hence only are we becoming”) (GA 13: 13).

10. The formula of faith without God is present in his first published work, Gedanken über religiöse Dinge (Bloch 1905/1906 [1992: 12]).

11. The tone itself, as a unit of analysis, is for Bloch “a locus of new social and political potentialities” (Gallope 2017: 106).

12. Colportage “refers to the portmanteau that a travelling salesman of serialized pulp stories, devotional literature, and religious tracts would carry, held in place by a strap around his neck” (Edwards 2013: 193).