The Textual Transmission of the Aristotelian Corpus

First published Fri Mar 7, 2025

The Aristotelian corpus (corpus aristotelicum) is the collection of the extant works transmitted under the name of Aristotle along with its organizational features, such as its ordering, internal textual divisions (into books and chapters) and titles. It has evolved over time: Aristotelian treatises have sometimes been lost and sometimes recovered, “spurious” works now regarded as inauthentic have joined the collection while scribes and scholars were attempting to organize its massive amount of text in various ways. The texts it includes are highly technical treatises that were not originally intended for publication and first circulated within Aristotle’s philosophical circle only, Aristotle distinguishes them from his “exoteric” works (Pol. 1278b30; EE 1217b22, 1218b34) which were meant for a wider audience.

The modern Aristotelian corpus is not identical with the total amount of philosophical texts produced by Aristotle. One major difference between the ancient and the modern corpus is that the ancient one included Aristotle’s dialogues, the most famous works that he “published” (i.e. made available to the general public) during his lifetime. The dialogues are now known only indirectly through quotations in other authors, they were written in a much more accessible style (praised by Cicero for its “golden flow”, Acad. Pr. 38.119) compared to the extant treatises and do not always reflect the same views. The discrepancy between the two sets of texts was already noted in ancient times (as Lucian puts it in the 2nd century CE, with Aristotle one gets two doctrines for the price of one: Vitarum auctio 26).

Even for the works that are assumed to have really been composed by Aristotle, there is a considerable distance between the witnesses to the text which have been preserved and Aristotle’s activity: the earliest available manuscripts often go back to the 9th century CE, at a time when the identity and structure of the collection had become stable, whereas Aristotle was active during the 4th century BCE, more than a millennium before. The Aristotelian corpus has only been preserved thanks to a reiterated and painstaking process of (manual) copying over centuries. This long-term transmission process must have had a tremendous impact on Aristotle’s text, but, as the original copies have been lost for more than two millennia, deviations induced by the transmission may often only be spotted indirectly, by means of careful comparisons between the various testimonies to the text that are still available.

There are often good reasons to suspect that some parts or features of Aristotle’s text are later artifacts. This is famously the case with the chapter-division that is now found in every Aristotelian treatise, which can at times run counter to the flow of Aristotle’s thought: the division goes back to Renaissance editions and has no manuscript basis. More generally, Aristotle’s text itself is far from stable across its different manuscript witnesses. With the production of each new copy the text has been exposed to all sorts of accidents and manipulations that editors now try to detect by comparing the different versions that have been preserved and investigating the ancient and medieval receptions of Aristotle’s works.

A scientific edition of a work of Aristotle is an attempt to reconstruct the ancient state of the text (which sometimes falls short of the original) on the basis of the extant data, provided under the main printed text in a critical apparatus. Modern readers of Aristotle should therefore be aware that what they read when they open a book purporting to contain a philosophical work authored by Aristotle, either in the original Greek or in a translation, is the product of a long and complicated transmission process. Some striking features of the Aristotelian corpus, such as the presence of “doublets” (identical passages occurring more than once in different books) or the existence of alternative versions, make this history obvious. There is no absolute guarantee that any part of Aristotle’s text as it is currently reconstructed corresponds exactly to what Aristotle would have wanted to express in the context where he would have wanted it to be expressed. That being said, when it comes to suspicions of inauthenticity or textual manipulation, the burden of the proof rests on the prosecution. In spite of many local controversies, there is a high level of scholarly consensus regarding the authenticity of the works which today make up our Aristotelian corpus.

1. Overview of the modern Aristotelian corpus

The modern Aristotelian corpus is defined by Bekker’s seminal 1831 edition, on which the standard reference system for Aristotle’s text is based (in scholarly citation, e.g. “Aristotle, Cat. 2a3” refers to the third line in the first column on the second page of Bekker’s edition; all scholarly modern editions and translations reference these numbers). It corresponds to 45 treatises in the following order (a Latin title is sometimes more commonly used in which case its English translation is given inside square brackets; works presumed to be inauthentic are preceded by an asterisk):

1
Categories (Cat.)
2
De interpretatione (DI) [On Interpretation]
3
Prior Analytics (APr)
4
Posterior Analytics (APo)
5
Topics (Top.)
6
Sophistical Refutations (SE)
7
Physics (Phys.)
8
De caelo (DC) [On the Heavens]
9
On Generation and Corruption (Gen. et Corr.)
10
Meteorology (Meteor.)
11
* De mundo (Mund.) [On the Universe]
12
De anima (DA) [On the Soul]
13–19
Parva naturalia (PN) [Brief Natural Treatises], a collection of short treatises: De sensu et sensibilibus (Sens.) [Sense and Sensibilia], De memoria et reminiscentia (Mem.) [On Memory and Reminiscence], De somno et vigilia (Somn. Vig.) [On Sleep and Wake], De insomniis (Insomn.) [On Dreams], De longitudine et brevitate vitae (Long.) [On Length and Shortness of Life], De juventute et senectute, De vita et morte, De respiratione [On Youth, Old Age, Life and Death, and Respiration, sometimes counted as three treatises]
20
* De spiritu (Spir.) [On Breath]
21
History of Animals (HA)
22
Parts of Animals (PA)
23
Movement of Animals (MA)
24
Progression of Animals (IA)
25
Generation of Animals (GA)
26
* De coloribus (Col.) [On Colours]
27
* De audibilibus [On Things Heard]
28
* Physiognomica (Phgn.) [Physiognomonics]
29
* De plantis (Plant.) [On Plants]
30
* De mirabilibus auscultationibus (Mir.) [On Marvellous Things Heard]
31
* Mechanica (Mech.) [Mechanics]
32
* Problemata (Probl.) [Problems]
33
* De lineis insecabilibus (Lin.) [On Indivisible Lines]
34
* Ventorum situs (Vent.) [The Situations and Names of Winds]
35
* De Melisso, Xenophane, Gorgia (MXG) [On Melissus, Xenophanes, and Gorgias]
36
Metaphysics (Met.)
37
Nicomachean Ethics (EN)
38
* Magna moralia (MM) [Great Ethics]
39
Eudemian Ethics (EE)
40
* On Virtues and Vices (Virt.)
41
Politics (Pol.)
42
* Economics (Oec.)
43
Rhetoric (Rhet.)
44
* Rhetoric to Alexander (Rhet. Al.)
45
Poetics (Poet.)

The Constitution of the Athenians, after its discovery in two papyri (PBerol. 5009 and PLond. 13, Pack 163 & 164) towards the end of the 19th century, is the only text to have joined the Aristotelian corpus since 1831. Fragments from Aristotle’s many lost works or spurious works preserved in languages other than Greek (such as the Liber de causis or De pomo) are excluded from the scope of this entry, even though they played a major role in the medieval reception of Aristotle.

The modern Aristotelian corpus is but a subset of the ancient Aristotelian corpus. It includes exclusively “esoteric” works that were not published in Aristotle’s lifetime and were intended for a restricted circle, allowing for an exceptionally dense and terse style that would not have been suited for a general audience. They are connected to Aristotle’s research and teaching activity within the various philosophical communities to which he belonged in the 4th century BCE (most prominently the Lyceum, his school), where communication is assumed to have been primarily oral (the Greek title of Phys. uses the word akroasis, “oral lecture”). With the possible exceptions of HA and the Constitution of the Athenians which may be classified as data collection, the extant texts are often described as “lecture notes”, either written down or dictated by Aristotle himself as an instrument for oral performances or by members of his audience as a recording of such performances. Although such hypotheses explain their generally condensed nature, some sections display literary qualities (such as the avoidance of hiatus) which can only result from much more careful redaction. Research efforts have to this day failed to identify stylistic criteria on which a chronology of Aristotle’s works could be securely established, it is highly likely that their texts were revised multiple times by Aristotle or by companions or students aiming at delivering similar oral performances, so that the extant texts may be suspected of being an accumulation of temporally distinct strata.

Late ancient commentators (especially Ammonius, late 5th century CE, In Cat. 4.5ff., and Simplicius, 6th century, In Phys. 8.16ff.) attribute to Aristotle a writing procedure which is well attested for later authors (general description in Dorandi 2000; Menn (m.s. [Other Internet Resources]). The aspiring author first writes cursory notes (hupomnèmata) on various materials recording interesting ideas, arguments or quotations encountered in conversation or reading, which are then collected and organized with a view to preparing a written treatment of a particular topic, before being reworked into a proper treatise (suggramma) using a much more polished style which, after some revision and correction, is finally ready for publication (ekdosis). Aristotle recommends taking such notes for the purpose of dialectics (Top. 105b12f.) and several items found in ancient lists of his works could plausibly correspond to notebooks of this kind. Late ancient commentators tend to maintain that the works now extant have reached their final form, their exceptional difficulty being envisaged as a deliberate feature: Aristotle wished, allegedly, to challenge the philosophical acumen of his audience. Modern scholars are much more willing to emphasize that Aristotle’s extant works were in all likelihood intended for a select audience who had direct access to its author, which explains their peculiar style.

There is ample evidence in Aristotle’s text of organizing efforts by Aristotle himself, these were obviously noticed by the tradition and are consequently reflected in the disposition of the modern corpus. Aristotle distinguishes in several places (e.g. Met. E.1) between theoretical sciences which aim at knowledge (= roughly treatises 1–29 in the modern corpus as numbered above), practical sciences which aim at performing correct actions (ethics and politics, = 37–42) and productive sciences which aim at producing determinate objects (= 43–5, about how to produce speeches and literary works). Theoretical sciences are then divided into physics (= at least 7–25), mathematics (no clear counterpart in the modern corpus) and first philosophy (= 36, Met.). Note that there is no place in Aristotle’s scheme for logic, which an ancient tradition, possibly starting with Andronicus of Rhodes, nonetheless places at the beginning of the corpus (= 1–6, the so-called Organon). The ancient Aristotelian corpus is already organized along similar lines in the list found in Diogenes Laertius (3rd century CE), which also includes works in different genres that are now lost, in (I) dialogues and exoteric works, (II) logic, (III) practical and productive sciences, (IV) theoretical sciences, (V) notes (hupomnèmata), (VI) data collections, (VI) letters and poems, suggesting that the present disposition of the corpus may go back, in its basic categories, to the Hellenistic period and possibly to Aristotle’s school.

The Aristotelian corpus contains many internal cross-references whereby the reader of a given text is referred to what “has been said” or “will be said” in some other text. They are all collected in the Aristoteles entry in Bonitz 1870. These backward and forward references organize the corpus according to an intended order of study, and not to the chronological sequence of its composition (Burnyeat 2001, ch.5). Ancient usage about titles is flexible and Aristotle is no exception to the rule (Fazzo 2010), a cross-reference may use a denomination denoting the whole treatise (“in the Physics”), a special book or part (“in On the Elements” = Gen. et Corr. II) or be completely vague (“elsewhere”). Some cross-references are likely to have emerged in the course of revisions (e.g. if treatise X refers back to Y even though Y is assumed to have been written after the bulk of X), it is possible (although no hard proof has ever been given) that some were also introduced by later editors in order to tie the corpus together. Certain cross-references are to lost works (for instance On Philosophy), so that the modern corpus cannot be said to be internally complete. The most puzzling phenomenon is the presence of (a) “blank” cross-references (Burnyeat 2004) which are to works which Aristotle never wrote according to the extant evidence, such as the treatise On Nutrition, or in which the topic at hand does not appear, and (b) mutually inconsistent cross-references (Rashed 2004) which presuppose incompatible orders of study. Both point again in the direction of a process of accumulation in the constitution of the corpus: it is likely that Aristotle (or his editors) evolved in his projects without always taking care of eliminating textual strata reflecting earlier versions.

The modern corpus is still organized according to this ideal order of study, as it was in ancient times. The organization of Aristotle’s works in Bekker’s edition corresponds for the most part (with some significant exceptions) to an organization found in the manuscript transmission, in the Neo-Platonist tradition, and in the ancient list of Aristotle’s works attributed to a certain Ptolemy. The major intellectual figure associated with this ancient organization is Andronicus of Rhodes (1st century BCE), who seems to have based his work on the evidence provided by Aristotle’s text itself, especially the cross-references it contains, and in documents pertaining to the activity of Aristotle’s school (such as an epistolary exchange between Theophrastus and Eudemus of Rhodes, both first-generation members). The correct order of study of Aristotle’s works, as intended by Aristotle and reconstructed mainly on the basis of this evidence, has been much discussed in ancient times quite early on: Andronicus of Rhodes and Boethus of Sidon (1st century BCE), for instance, disagreed on whether one should start with logic or physics, there are reports of a work On the Order of Aristotle’s Treatises by Adrastus of Aphrodisias (2nd century CE).

2. General historical outline

2.1 Until the 1st century CE: Scepsis and its legend

Our information about the earliest stages of the transmission process that resulted in the Aristotelian corpus we now read is extremely sparse (general overviews in Moraux 1973 and Gottschalk 1987). Although Aristotle’s works were discussed among his students (especially Theophrastus of Eresus and Eudemus of Rhodes), there is little trace of any in-depth engagement with them for most of the Hellenistic period, between roughly 270 and 90 BCE. A revival of interest for Aristotle’s thought and writings occurred in the 1st centuries BCE and CE, centered on Cat. (Griffin 2015). The period seems to have been decisive for the shaping of the Aristotelian corpus, the most important piece of information available comes from a famous ancient anecdote.

Strabo (Geography XIII, 1.54; 1st century BCE) and Plutarch (Sulla 26; 1st century CE) both report a very entertaining story about the fate of Aristotle’s “books” or “library”, meaning both the books written by others Aristotle had acquired and his own production. It is not difficult to put together a coherent narrative based on their two testimonies.

  1. After Aristotle’s death around 322 BCE, his vast collection of books becomes the property of Theophrastus of Eresus, one of his dearest colleagues and friends.
  2. Theophrastus (d. c. 287 BCE), after having taken Aristotle’s succession at the head of the Lyceum, bequeaths in turn his library, including the collection he had inherited from Aristotle, to Neleus (an old member of the school, himself the son of Coriscus who was already active in the Academy and the Lyceum). This is confirmed by the will of Theophrastus reproduced in Diogenes Laertius (V.52). Strato of Lampsacus (d. c. 269 BCE) becomes the new head of the Peripatetic school after Theophrastus’ death.
  3. Neleus takes the books to his hometown of Scepsis, where he dies. The Lyceum is now deprived of the works of its first two heads and enters a period of intellectual stagnation (Totenschlaf: Wilamowitz-Moellendorff 1881, 83).
  4. As the royal dynasty in nearby Pergamon is amassing books in order to build a prestigious library rivaling Alexandria’s, Neleus’ heirs in Scepsis, having no particular interest in philosophy, decide to hide the books in some underground storage space.
  5. Aristotle’s and Theophrastus’ books remain there for decades; their state deteriorates due to humidity and worms.
  6. Apellicon of Teos (d. c. 84 BCE), a wealthy collector of antiquities of great wealth and dubious morals, acquires the whole collection, now seriously damaged, and, according to Strabo, has the texts copied in a botched edition in which he desperately tries to supply missing bits. Apellicon is also reported to have bought “Aristotle’s books” by Athenaeus (Deipnosophistae V, 214d; late 2nd century CE).
  7. The Roman general Sulla (138–78 BCE), having sacked Athens in 86 BCE, appropriates the collection which is then transferred to his estate in Rome.
  8. After Sulla’s death in 78 BCE, Tyrannio, a Greek scholar belonging to the same Roman intelligentsia as Cicero, manages to gain access to Sulla’s library and performs some conservation work on the books from Scepsis.
  9. According to Plutarch, Andronicus of Rhodes obtains from Tyrannio copies of the books which he uses for his edition of Aristotle’s works.

Andronicus of Rhodes is the only editor of Aristotle mentioned in ancient sources. His edition must have been published at some point between 75 BCE and 30 CE; the exact date is controversial. Andronicus is reported to have also published “tables” (pinakes) in at least five books where he provided a biography of Aristotle and a detailed catalog of Aristotle’s works. The only substantial piece of information about Andronicus’ work is provided by Porphyry, who took Andronicus as a model when preparing his own edition of Plotinus’ works (301 CE). Porphyry reports that Andronicus “arranged the works of Aristotle and Theophrastus according to their subject-matter, collecting in the same place the treatments that were akin” (Life of Plotinus 24).

Four ancient lists of Aristotle’s works are extant: (1) a list is found in Diogenes Laertius’ entry on Aristotle (Lives of Eminent Philosophers V.22ff., reference text: Dorandi 2013; probably 3rd century CE), (2) another surfaced in 1664 along with a biography of Aristotle known as the Vita Menagiana (reference text: Dorandi 2006) and is generally assumed to go back to the Onomatologos of Hesychius of Miletum (another encyclopedia about famous ancient figures; 6th century CE), (3) another list is found in an appendix to the latter of uncertain origin, (4) there is a very different list in an Epistle attributed to a certain Ptolemy (probably 3rd century CE) that only survives in an Arabic translation (reference text: Rashed 2021). The first three lists are essentially identical (bar certain dubious additions in the appendix). As they are substantially different from the corpus on which ancient commentators rely after the 1st century CE, they are assumed to reflect a Hellenistic state of the Aristotelian corpus that had become outdated at this point. By contrast, Ptolemy’s list generally corresponds to the post-Hellenistic corpus used by later scholars, of which the modern corpus represents the core part.

A modern academic legend combines all the elements above into the following scenario: “Aristotle’s works were lost for most of the Hellenistic period, between the 3rd and the 1st century BCE, because the only copies had been stored underground in Scepsis by Neleus’ heirs. The only works that were accessible for this period are the ones found in the lists of Diogenes Laertius and Hesychius. The complete Aristotelian corpus only resurfaced in the 1st century BCE in connection with Apellicon and Sulla, it was eventually made available to a general audience thanks to the monumental edition of Andronicus of Rhodes which is faithfully reflected in Ptolemy’s Epistle and became, much like Bekker’s edition today, the reference-point for subsequent Aristotelian scholars. Andronicus gave its definitive organization to the disparate and damaged material unearthed by Apellicon, producing the treatises of Aristotle in their present form.”

Following the legend, many features of the Aristotelian corpus, such as the general structure of certain works or books (regarding especially Met., for which the relationships between its constituent books often appear quite loose), the presence of transition passages at the beginning or the end of thematically separate section, or the presence of cross-references that tie together various works, are suspected of having originated in Andronicus’ activity, at some point in the course of the 1st century BCE. The co-existence of two book-numbering systems even in the modern Aristotelian corpus, an archaic one following the alphabet (book VII is then numbered ζ “zeta” = the seventh letter of the Greek alphabet) and a post-classical one using number-letters (book VII is then numbered ς “stigma” using an artificial letter that does not belong to the standard alphabet), might suggest that at least the treatises for which the archaic system has remained in use (e.g. Met.), were not integrated in Hellenistic libraries, in which it would otherwise have been updated, and only resurfaced later (Primavesi 2007).

There is no denying that important editorial work took place between the state of the Aristotelian corpus reflected in the lists of Diogenes Laertius and Hesychius and the state reflected in Ptolemy’s list, the latter being much closer to the corpus on which ancient commentators rely (of which the modern corpus is a subset). There are numerous cases (Moraux 1951) in which works which are registered are self-standing treatises in the first two lists plausibly correspond to books which are part of larger works in the latter (e.g. On Diction in two books in Diogenes Laertius = book III of Rhet. in Ptolemy and in the extant treatise). Still, there are serious reasons to doubt the veracity of at least parts of the anecdote and of the subsequent legend.

(a) The alleged “decline” of the Peripatetic school seems to have very little to do with the alleged loss of Aristotle’s and Theophrastus’ books and very much to do with a shift towards a research program focused on natural sciences under Strato and his successors (overview in Lefebvre 2016 or Baltussen 2016). Instead of assuming that Andronicus’ edition suddenly caused a “renaissance” of the Aristotelian tradition, it may have been itself motivated by a renewed interest in Aristotle’s philosophy in the 1st century BCE (Frede 1999).

(b) It is difficult to imagine that at the time of Theophrastus’ death there existed only one single copy of Aristotle’s works in the whole Greek world (Barnes 1997) and that most of Aristotle’s philosophical treatises remained virtually unknown during the Hellenistic period. There is evidence that already within the first generation of Aristotle’s students Eudemus of Rhodes had made his own copies and brought them to his native island. The matter would be settled once and for all if it could be shown that some of the works of Aristotle which allegedly disappeared underground were available to some authors during the Hellenistic period. The problem is that, although there is evidence of various engagements with Aristotle’s works (Epicurus, for instance, is reported to have read the Analytics), the most indisputable form of proof that an author had direct access to a treatise of Aristotle would be a running commentary. Everything else, even quotations, could be attributed to second-hand materials, such as compendia or textbooks that would have recorded some of Aristotle’s views or phrases. Unfortunately, however, the genre of the philosophical commentary only emerged after the 1st century BCE.

(c) There are well-attested connections between the Lyceum and the nascent Ptolemaic dynasty in Egypt: Strato, Theophrastus’ successor, serves as tutor to the future Ptolemy II (309–246 BCE) while Demetrius of Phalerum, another prominent member of the school, settles in Alexandria after 297 CE where he seems to have played an important role in the creation of the fabled library of the Museum. Another ancient author, Athenaeus (Deipnosophistae I, 3a-b; late 2nd century CE) even reports that all of Aristotle’s (and probably Theophrastus’) books were bought from the same Neleus by king Ptolemy II for the library of Alexandria, thus contradicting the story found in Strabo and Plutarch.

(d) Ptolemy’s list of Aristotle’s works includes a section entitled “books found in Apellicon’s library”, under which only vague “notes” (hupomnèmata) and a collection of letters put together by “Artemon” (probably Artemon of Pergamon) are registered. The next item in the list mentions Andronicus, it is again a collection of both notes and letters that Andronicus is said to have published for the first time, for which Ptolemy refers his reader to Andronicus’ “tables”. This suggests that everything else in Ptolemy’s list was discovered neither by Apellicon nor by Andronicus (Rashed 2021).

(e) The general level of disorganization of the modern corpus, with its textual doublets, “blank” cross-references and incompatible transitions, speaks against its having been shaped once and for all by a single editor. Porphyry does not ascribe any work on the details of Aristotle’s text to Andronicus but takes his inspiration from him regarding the operation of “collecting” treatises. As the major operation performed by Porphyry on the text of Plotinus consisted in organizing his lectures according to thematic principles (instead of chronology) in three codices (i.e. bound books and not old-fashioned papyrus scrolls with less writing space), the bulk of Andronicus’ editorial activity probably involved identifying, collecting and organizing Aristotle’s treatises according to subject-matters (Hatzimichali 2013 & 2016) – perhaps “logic”, “physics”, “ethics” – and adapting them to the new format of the codex, determining the exact boundaries of each work and of its different books (Rashed 2021).

What the legend obscures, by putting Andronicus and his edition on a pedestal of authority, is the persistence of ancient debates surrounding the Aristotelian corpus. Andronicus’ major editorial decisions, as far as the extant evidence goes, amount to (I) the condemnation of DI as inauthentic because of a puzzling cross-reference to DA in 16a8f. (which Andronicus therefore cannot have authored; Moraux 1973, 117–9), (II) the rejection of the last part of Cat. (ch.10–15, the “post-predicaments”) as having been inserted in the treatise by some previous scholars who had wanted Cat. to serve as an introduction to Top. (Boethius, In Cat. IV, 64.263bff.; Simplicius, In Cat. 379.8ff.) and (III) his defense of a division of Phys. into two parts, books I–V being the Physics properly speaking and books VI–VIII being a different work entitled On Motion, in favor of which he adduced evidence from an epistolary exchange between Eudemus and Theophrastus (Simplicius, In Phys. 450.16ff., 801.13ff., 923.7ff.; Moraux 1973, 115–6). All three presuppose that Andronicus viewed himself as reacting to some (allegedly mistaken) editorial work that had taken place between Aristotle and himself. The first two decisions have been unanimously rejected by subsequent ancient scholars.

2.2 Between the 1st century and the 9thcentury CE: teaching Aristotle

The canon of Aristotle’s works becomes stable in the 2nd and 3rd centuries CE. The activity of Alexander of Aphrodisias (around 200 CE), arguably the greatest ancient commentator on Aristotle, focuses on treatises that are part of the modern Aristotelian corpus with the same general textual features. The traditional titles of Aristotle’s works seem to have been well established after this point, although some were still regarded as challenging (Hoffmann 1997). The Aristotelian corpus available during this period is still much larger than ours: it includes (a) Aristotle’s published dialogues, (b) collections of data gathered in the school about various fields (e.g. anatomical descriptions of various animals, constitutional histories of various cities), (c) other school materials (collections of divisions, premises, etc.), (d) treatises in which Aristotle discussed the views of other thinkers, most prominently of Plato and his school, (e) various scientific works on specific topics. All of this has been lost. Taking into account the missing parts is liable to change one’s outlook on Aristotle’s output or biography: Aristotle’s lost dialogues, assuming that they contained views close to Plato’s and incompatible with the views put forward in the school works, have been used in Neo-Platonism as evidence for the existence of an agreement between Aristotle and Plato, assuming that there is no inconsistency between the dialogues and the esoteric works (Gerson 2005, ch.2), and in modern times by proponents of developmental theories as evidence for a Platonist phase in Aristotle’s philosophical trajectory (famously by Jaeger 1923),

As with every ancient text, Aristotle’s works could only circulate thanks to a repeated process of copying which inevitably introduced errors in the text. Some would have been easy to spot, others may have resulted in more dramatic results, such as skipping lines. Moreover, Aristotle’s style in the extant treatises is so uniquely terse that any serious reading or teaching activity is likely to introduce many glosses and exegetical annotations in the original text. As ancient practices do not always clearly demarcate between textual corrections and other types of para-text (glosses, musings, signposts, etc.), this material tended to find its way into the original text. The process is aggravated by the composition of ancient paraphrases (Andronicus had already written one for Cat.) that aimed at conveying the same message in clearer terms and sometimes ended up replacing the original.

Ancient readers were aware of these dangers and tried, whenever possible, to use authoritative copies of the text and sometimes compared several copies. Ancient commentators on Aristotle, starting with Aspasius and Alexander, often report on variant readings or even alternative versions. As a result, their works offer an invaluable testimony regarding the ancient state of Aristotle’s text, which is sometimes found to differ significantly from the evidence found in medieval manuscripts, offering glimpses of a much more diverse ancient textual landscape. Aspasius, for instance, discusses five textual variants in his commentary on the Ethics (Barnes 1999), is the source for Alexander’s report (In Met. 58.31ff.) about a correction made by Eudorus of Alexandria (1st century BCE) in the text of Met. A.6 (this correction has prevailed in the manuscript transmission: Primavesi 2024) and has access to a redacted version of Phys. (Moraux 1984, 289).

From the 4th century CE onward, Aristotle’s treatises, especially the Organon, were mostly studied as an introduction to Plato in the Neo-Platonist schools of Athens and Alexandria, which exerted a major influence on the Arabic and Byzantine receptions of Aristotle. Their decline and eventual disappearance, under growing Christian pressure and later Muslim conquests in the 7th and 8th centuries, led to the loss of a large share of ancient philosophical literature, including most of what is now lost within the ancient Aristotelian corpus. Even for the treatises that were preserved, the number of available copies seems to have drastically shrunk, which had a negative impact on the quality of the copies that were subsequently produced.

2.3 The Byzantine period (c. 850–1453)

Within the context of a renewed interest in ancient culture in the Byzantine empire of the 9th century, ancient texts were gradually transcribed from carefully selected late ancient copies using a new writing system: the process involved switching from majuscule to minuscule script (Greek metacharachtèrismos, Latin translitteratio), thus saving precious space. Only a few minuscule copies were produced directly against the old majuscule copies for most ancient works; these are the source for later medieval manuscripts. In the case of Aristotelian texts, the manuscript transmission usually goes back to one, two or three such copies.

The earliest extant manuscripts of Aristotle were produced around this period in the 9th and 10th centuries, mostly in Constantinople. The manuscript with shelf-marks Vatican, Urb. gr. 35 (commonly referred to by means of the siglum A since Bekker’s edition; early 10th century) preserves the Organon; Vienna, ÖNB, phil. gr. 100 (J; mid-9th c.) and Paris, BnF, grec 1853 (E; mid-10th c.) preserve most of the treatises of natural philosophy along with Met.; Oxford, Corpus Christi College, 108 (Z; early 9th c.) preserves the zoological treatises; Paris, BnF, grec 1741 (Ac ; second half of the 10th c.) preserves Rhet and Poet..; parts of Pol. are preserved in Vatican, Vat. gr. 1298 (10th c.; it is a palimpsest: an old copy of Aristotelian text has been recycled as material on which another text has been copied). Urb. gr. 35 was produced for the high-ranking church official and scholar Arethas of Caesarea (c. 860–c. 935), himself a student of Photius. No personal manuscript of famous Byzantine scholars such as Photius (9th c.) or Michael Psellos (11th c.) has survived, although there was definitely some engagement with Aristotle during the period. Imperial princess Anna Comnena sponsored the composition of new commentaries on Aristotle in the first half of the 12th century by scholars such as Eustratius of Nicea and Michael of Ephesus, focusing on works which had been neglected by the ancient commentary tradition.

The Latin conquest and sack of Constantinople in 1204 marks an important turning point. The city, which had served as the cultural center of the Greek-speaking world, remained under Western control until 1264. Many cultural artifacts, especially manuscripts, were looted or destroyed. Ancient texts that were still available in Constantinople before 1204 disappeared, including Aristotle’s Anatomies which Michael of Ephesus could still read. Still, Constantinople was far from the only place where Aristotle was read in Greek. There were intellectually active Greek-speaking communities in Southern Italy and Sicily, in which a special version of EE was preserved (Harlfinger 1971).

Aristotle’s treatises were also translated in other languages during the medieval period. Some works, mostly from the Organon, had already been translated into Latin in ancient times (by Boethius, 6th c.) and into Syriac in connection with the diffusion of Neoplatonist thought. After the Islamic conquests of Syria and Egypt (where the city of Alexandria was a major Greek cultural center) in the 7th century as well as cultural exchanges with Byzantium, most of the Aristotelian corpus was translated in Arabic. Major translation movements occurred within the so-called “circle of al-Kindī” in the 9th century, in the circle of Ḥunayn ibn Isḥāq and his son in the late 9th century, and in 10th-century Baghdad. Even though not all these translations have survived, they are often observed to be exceptional textual witnesses as they draw on a textual tradition that is distinct from the one attested in Byzantine manuscripts.

The whole Aristotelian corpus was gradually translated into Latin during the 12th and 13th centuries. Some translations were made by Gerard of Cremona (d. 1187) in Toledo based on pre-existing Arabic translations. Others were made using Greek copies found in Constantinople and in other parts of the Greek-speaking world, most notably by James of Venice and in Sicily by Henricus Aristippus around the middle of the 12th century. These medieval translations were collected along with Boethius’ into a “corpus vetustius” which became standard reference material in Western European universities at the beginning of the 13th century. This corpus vetustius does not cover the whole Aristotelian corpus that has survived in Greek, and its translations are often difficult to understand without the underlying Greek (if not at times completely obscure). The whole extant corpus was translated into Latin, either for the first time or in a revised form, in the 13th century, for the most part by Dominican friar William of Moerbeke (d. c. 1286), who often acted as a diplomatic intermediary between the papal court and Byzantium and had access to exceptional Greek libraries. Subsequently, a new collection, the corpus recentius, emerged, which became the standard Latin edition of Aristotle’s works until the Renaissance.

2.4 The Renaissance and beyond

After the Ottoman conquest of Constantinople in 1453, many Byzantine scholars took refuge in the island of Crete (then under the control of Venice) and in Italy, where interest for Greek language and culture had been steadily growing since the end of the 14th century. The most famous is Bessarion, who eventually became a cardinal of the Catholic church. Bessarion hired many other exiles as scribes in an effort to preserve as much of Greek culture as possible in a vast library which he eventually donated to the city of Venice in 1468. More generally, a rush for Greek manuscripts among Western scholars and nobility led to the constitution of many prestigious collections during the 14th and 15th centuries, which form the backbone of the Greek holdings of many present-day Western European libraries. Most extant Aristotle manuscripts were accordingly produced during the 15th century.

The first printed edition of Aristotle’s works (editio princeps) in the original Greek was published between 1495 and 1498 by the press of Aldus Manutius in Venice. It is generally based on 15th-century manuscripts that were circulating in academic circles at the time. Bar a few discrepancies (its text of Lin. is actually a paraphrase written by Pachymeres c. 1300), it corresponds to the modern Aristotelian corpus. Many editions of Aristotle’s works were later published in the 16th century, gradually introducing a chapter-division in Aristotle’s text that has no basis in the manuscript transmission. The now traditional chapter-division was definitively established in the edition published in Basel in 1551 and prepared by Michael Isengrin. All these editions adopt as their starting point the text of some previous printed edition (usually the Aldine edition) and introduce additional corrections either based on alternative manuscripts or as editorial conjectures, often without explicitly distinguishing between the two. Bekker’s 1831 edition is the first complete printed edition that starts afresh from a selection of medieval manuscripts, doing away with the accumulation of Renaissance correction attempts, and makes the relationship between the printed text and the manuscript evidence explicit by means of a critical apparatus signaling the various manuscript readings available for each line of text.

3. Ancient and modern debates

3.1 The Organon

The modern Organon corresponds to Aristotle’s “logic” and runs as follows: Cat., DI, APr, APo, Top., SE. While there are textual indications that the two Analytics are parts of the same project and that SE is meant to follow Top. (there is an inconsistency in the textual evidence, as SE is sometimes presented as a part of Top. and sometimes as a separate treatise: Brunschwig 2004), Aristotle is certainly not responsible for grouping these treatises in this way under this label. Logic is not acknowledged by Aristotle as a special science or part of philosophy, the denomination “organon” (“instrument”, see Barnes 2007), which has not been coined by Aristotle (its exact origin is unknown), reflects Hellenistic controversies regarding its status. The sequence follows a sort of compositional linguistic progression reminiscent of Stoic philosophy, going from the elementary constituents of speech (Cat.) to propositions (DI) and then to deduction (sullogismos) under its various types (general theory: APr; scientific deduction: APo; dialectical: Top; eristic or sophistical: SE). It distorts the content of the first two treatises, as Cat. and DI are autonomous works that deal simultaneously with grammar, semantics, ontology and psychology and have little to do with Aristotle’s logical theory of deduction (Brunschwig 1989).

The modern Organon is identical to the one advocated by Alexander of Aphrodisias. There are alternative ancient arrangements. The list of Aristotle’s work in Diogenes Laertius does not place Cat. and DI in its main logical part, which has APr and APo precede Top. (under a different title). Most books in Top. also appear as independent works. The doxographical section in Diogenes Laertius organizes Aristotle’s logic in a different way than his list, following a scheme originating in the Hellenistic Academy (III.28–9; Gourinat 2013): invention (Top. and two lost works entitled Methodics and Premises), judgment (the two Analytics) and use (which includes SE). Andronicus’ organization of Aristotle’s logic is uncertain: his version of the Organon cannot have included DI which he deemed inauthentic, it may have positioned Cat. in a different place given that Andronicus rejected an alternative title “Before the Topics”. In Ptolemy’s list, Top. is placed after APr (under the title “Analytics”) and before Apo. (under the title “Apodictics”).

The status of Rhet. and Poet. has given rise to much controversy, due in no small part to Aristotle’s opening statement that rhetoric is the “counterpart” (antistrophè) of dialectic (Rhet. 1354a1; Brunschwig 1994). The two treatises are excluded from the Organon in the modern corpus. Neo-Platonist commentators in the 5th and 6th centuries have taken different stances (Gourinat 2013): although Ammonius also excludes them from the Organon as did Alexander of Aphrodisias, Simplicius includes Rhet. and excludes Poet. as Galen and Alcinoos seem to have done in the 2nd century, while Olympiodorus and Elias, followed by Philoponus, include both Rhet. and Poet. in the Organon. This “longer” Organon is the version that has reached the Arabic Aristotelian tradition, where it has led to the development of a notion of a “poetic” type of deduction.

The composition of Cat. as it is transmitted appears suspicious (Frede 1999). Olympiodorus (In Cat. 22.38ff.) reports that the authenticity of the treatise had been questioned especially because it introduces views that are allegedly contradicted in other places in the corpus. There are ancient reports about alternative versions, one of which was still read by Adrastus of Aphrodisias and seems to have been a sort of paraphrastic version intended to resolve certain ambiguities in Aristotle’s text (Simplicius, In Cat. 18.16ff.; Ammonius, In Cat. 13.20ff.). Out of Aristotle’s ten categories, only four are seriously examined in the extant treatise (substance, quantity, relatives and quality). The last part of the treatise deals with general notions (“post-predicaments”, ch.10–15) that apply across the categories, including a short treatment of having even though having is supposed to feature among the ten categories. This last part was regarded as an insertion by Andronicus. The very title Categories does not seem to have been used by Aristotle, there is at least one ancient alternative title Before the Places (= before the Topics) found in Diogenes Laertius which is reported to have been rejected by Andronicus (and still defended two centuries later by Adrastus of Aphrodisias).

The authenticity of DI had also been attacked by Andronicus based on a “blank” reference to DA, without leaving any major impact on the ancient reception of the work. It seems actually to result from a textual corruption (Maier 1900). Book V of Top. is likely to be inauthentic in view of its lack of consistency and to have been compiled at an early date (before Alexander of Aphrodisias), possibly on the basis of Aristotelian materials (Reinhardt 2000). The existence of a lost second book of Aristotle’s Poetics and its relationship to the extant text are disputed (Veloso 2018, 401–3).

Aristotle refers to either the Prior or Posterior Analytics under the general label “Analytics”, suggesting that they are meant to form one single work (Brunschwig 1981, Crubellier 2008). Even if the current way of distinguishing between the two is already attested in the list in Diogenes Laertius, the titles and the relation of the two Analytics were still debated in the first centuries CE, as Galen (On My Own Books, 14.12) expresses his preference for calling the former On Deduction and the latter On Demonstrations (a title similar to the title Apodictics in Ptolemy’s list) on the basis of Aristotle’s own usage, while Alexander of Aphrodisias tries to discern this very meaning behind the traditional labels “prior” and “posterior” (In APr 42.22f.).

3.2 Natural science

The part of the Aristotelian corpus that deals with nature (“physics” in the broad sense) is unified and ordered by the prologue of Meteor. (338a20ff.). It has two main subparts, the first four treatises being a general investigation into the universe and its dynamic structure, followed by a study of animal and vegetal living beings.

We have already discussed the first causes of nature, and all natural motion (= Phys.), also the stars ordered in the motion of the heavens (= DC), and the corporeal elements— enumerating and specifying them and showing how they change into one another— and becoming and perishing in general (= Gen. et Corr.). There remains for consideration a part of this inquiry which all our predecessors called meteorology (= Meteor). It is concerned with events that are natural, though their order is less perfect than that of the first of the elements of bodies (…) When the inquiry into these matters is concluded let us consider what account we can give, in accordance with the method we have followed, of animals and plants, both generally and in detail. When that has been done we may say that the whole of our original undertaking will have been carried out. (ROT)

The first two sentences prescribe an order of study for the first four treatises which is followed by the ancient tradition. Each still presents special challenges.

There is an ancient debate about Phys. involving Andronicus, our main source being Simplicius who relies here on Adrastus (In Phys. 4.11ff, 801.13ff. and 924.13ff.; In DC 226.19). The lists of Diogenes Laertius and Hesychius provide some evidence that some of its books have circulated as self-standing works. Their collection was sometimes called “On Principles” and sometimes “Lecture on Nature”, as in the manuscript transmission. Within the eight books we now call Phys., Andronicus distinguished two parts, calling the first five books the Physics and the next three books On Motion, apparently offering in support a quotation from a letter of Theophrastus to Eudemus in which the fifth book was said to be part of the Physics. Others, including Porphyry and Philoponus (In Phys. 2.15f.), divided the work in two parts having four books each, the first four being called On Principles and the last four On Motion. The debate probably originated in the comparison of the internal cross-references to Phys. in the corpus where the label “on motion” is used (DC 272a30f. and 275b21f.) and hinges on a conceptual tension between books III and V (Brunschwig 1991): “motion” (kinèsis) refers in the former to any kind of change, including change according to substance, whereas it only refers to non-substantial change in the latter. Book VII has long been observed to be problematic, as it offers a proof for the existence of the Prime Mover which seems to be made redundant by the much more detailed argument of book VIII. Eudemus of Rhodes skipped it in his own work on Phys. (Simplicius, In Phys. 1036.13f.), Simplicius knows of a very different version of its text (1036.4f.) which has been preserved in part of the manuscript tradition for the first chapters, it is unclear whether one of the two is inauthentic.

DC reads very much like a series of three distinct treatises about the heavens (books I–II), the elements (book III) and weight (book IV). Simplicius reports an ancient debate about the way its traditional title relates to its content (In DC 1.1ff.): Alexander explained the title by arguing that “the heaven” (ouranos) should be understood as meaning “the world” (kosmos) whereas Iamblichus reserved the word “heaven” for the supralunary region studied in the first two books. Book III seems to answer to the same project as Gen. et Corr. and actually announces a study of generation and corruption in its first chapter, so that Gen. et Corr. could be read as its direct continuation, as there is little textual evidence that it was intended as a self-standing work (Brunschwig 2004).

Within Meteor., book I has been accused in ancient times of being inauthentic (Olympiodorus, In Meteor. 4.16ff.), one of the main arguments being that it makes use of an extra-missive theory of sight that is rejected in DA II and Sens. While the end of book III announces an investigation about the formation of rocks and metals based on Aristotle’s double exhalation theory, book IV offers a much more general treatment of the formation of simple bodies that does not rely on this theory but on other notions, such as pores (ch.8–9), with questionable Aristotelian credentials (Gottschalk 1961). Ancient commentators were already quite embarrassed by the situation regarding book IV, Alexander of Aphrodisias questioned whether the book really belonged to the treatise as its subject-matter is much closer to that of Gen. et Corr. (In Meteor. 179.3ff., Natali 2002). The medieval Latin translations tried to get rid of the issue by inserting a short treatise On Minerals which is itself a translation of a section of Avicenna’s Shifāʾ (Cure).

The description of the study about “animals and plants” that is said to follow the general study of nature is too cursory in the prologue of Meteor. to be precisely related to the extant works. While Aristotle’s work on plants is lost, numerous treatises about animals have been preserved. There are many clues in Aristotle’s text that provide some information about their intended order of study, but they are not always mutually consistent (Rashed 2004). The general sequence starts with PA I, which serves as a general introduction to the study of animals (although the book itself looks much like a “string of papers”, Balme 1972) and ends with GA, which was probably supposed to be followed by the lost treatise on plants. The remaining books of PA are traditionally followed by IA, which extends the project to the study of the locomotive parts of animals. There are textual indications that DA, PN and MA should be placed between PA-IA and GA, as is the case in the ancient tradition and in the manuscript transmission. This is not the case in the modern corpus: Bekker’s edition places DA and PN after the four general physical treatises (augmented with the pseudo-Aristotelian Mund.) and before the zoological treatises, thus suggesting that “psychology” is a separate discipline from zoology. Bekker’s radical decision derives from intense debates in the Renaissance about the status of the study of the soul in Aristotle’s project (Perfetti 2000).

It is uncertain whether HA, which is an organized collection of zoological data, belongs to the sequence as one of its first members or should stand outside of it as a repository. An entry in Diogenes Laertius suggests that its tenth and last book had circulated as an independent treatise On Sterility. Its authenticity is still debated on doctrinal grounds, as is the question of whether it really belongs to the treatise (Eijk 1999). The order of the various books of the treatise in the manuscript transmission has been rearranged by Theodorus Gaza (along with some portions of texts) in his 1476 Latin translation, placing what is transmitted as book IX in seventh place. His decision was followed in most editions before being reversed in Balme 2002.

The composition of PN is especially difficult. The Latin title (Parva naturalia, “short works on natural topics”) of the collection seems to have been coined in the 13th century in the circle of Thomas Aquinas’ students. Its treatises have no such collective designation in the ancient tradition, even though they are clearly unified by the prologue of Sens. which introduces all of their subject-matters. The treatise MA is regarded as part and parcel of PN in the ancient tradition (in accordance with the cross-reference in DA 431b20) but is removed from the collection in Bekker’s edition where MA is associated with IA instead in the zoological section. Some indications in Aristotle’s text, especially in the prologue of Sens. presuppose that the whole PN (MA included) should follow DA and precede GA while others suggest dividing the collection into two separate parts, one following DA and one following GA.

3.3 The Metaphysics

The treatise has been a riddle since ancient times (general presentation: Menn m.s. [Other Internet Resources]), as many of its features denote editorial intervention – and in view of the difficulty of understanding how Aristotle’s explicit project of a “first philosophy” relates to the extant material. The Metaphysics contains two “Book One”, traditionally called “Alpha” (= number 1) “major” (A) and “minor” (α) on account of their respective lengths. Some sections of its text constitute doublets as they are found to be identical either within the treatise itself (e.g. if one compares A.9 with M.4–5) or within the larger corpus (e.g. if one compares Δ.2 with Phys. II.3). It is controversial whether the work as it now stands was intended by Aristotle as a unified project or put together at a later date. Book Δ, for instance, is a series of entries about key philosophical terms, it likely corresponds to a separate entry in Diogenes’ and Hesychius’ lists (with the title On Things Said in Several Ways). There is an ancient tradition associating the treatise with Aristotle’s student Eudemus of Rhodes: Asclepius (In Met. 4.4–16; 6th c. CE), perhaps relying on Alexander of Aphrodisias, relates that the work was sent by Aristotle to Eudemus, who recommended that it should not be published. Some parts were allegedly later destroyed, which incompetent editors tried to supply by drawing from other Aristotelian works.

Its Greek title (meta ta phusika, “after natural things” or “after Phys.”; other alternative such as First Philosophy were also known in late antiquity) does not refer to a special area within philosophy. This is, however, the actual historical origin of the word “metaphysics”. It probably indicates the position of the treatise within the order of study intended by Aristotle (Alexander, In Met. 171.4–8) or within the organization given to the corpus by an ancient editor. The origin of the title is uncertain but is in all likelihood Hellenistic, the treatise appears with this title in Ptolemy’s list (with 13 books, and not 14 as is the case today) and in Hesychius (with 10 or 20 books) but not in the list found in Diogenes Laertius (perhaps due to a mechanical loss).

There is evidence that the authenticity of book A had already been questioned in Alexander’s time, as Alexander feels the need to defend it (In Met. 196.20–5). Asclepius reports that “some” have attributed the book to Pasicles of Rhodes, Eudemus’ brother about whom little else is known (In Met. 4.17–35; a scholium in manuscript Paris, grec 1853 points in the same direction: Vuillemin-Diem 1983, Berti 1982). Its coexistence with book α points toward an earlier state of the treatise where only one “first book” was known, which might be reflected in the entry in Ptolemy stating that the work has 13 books. There are traces of philosophically motivated textual interventions in the manuscript transmission of book Α (Primavesi 2012 & 2024). The status of book α, which is much shorter and, although it is certainly an introduction, hardly connects directly with the following book B, is much discussed in the commentaries of Alexander and Asclepius, its authenticity has been questioned in modern scholarship. Alexander reports that some had held book Δ to be incomplete, as it does not contain a discussion of everything that is said in several ways (In Met. 345.4ff.). The first part of book K (ch.1–7) reads like a summary of books ΓΔΕ while its second part (ch.8–12) looks like a compilation from various places in Phys. As a result, there are serious doubts about its authenticity (Aubenque 1983). Part of the manuscript transmission offers an additional bit of text in book Θ which, even if it seems to be genuinely Aristotelian, is generally interpreted as being out of place (Burnyeat 2008). Syrianus (In Met. 160.6ff.; early 5th c.) signals the existence of a debate about the exact boundary between the last two books Μ and Ν.

3.4 Ethics and Politics

There are four ethical treatises in the modern Aristotelian corpus: EN, EE, MM and the pseudo-Aristotelian Virt. MM is generally assumed to be a sort of summary of Aristotle’s Ethics produced within the school. Its title (“great ethics”) reflects, not its superior prestige, but the special length of its books compared to EN and EE.

Broadly speaking, EN, EE and MM are quite similar, both in their philosophical views and in structure. All three deal with the same topics in the same order: happiness and the good; moral virtues; intellectual virtues; vices and weakness of the will; friendship. EN and EE share no less than three books, the so-called “common books” (EE IV–VI = EN V–VII). Numerous modern editions and translations of EE, starting with Bekker, omits these books, assuming that they properly belong to EN (this is not the case with the manuscript transmission, although some manuscripts with both EE and EN do not have the common books twice: Harlfinger 1971).

The relationship between EN and EE and the status of these “common books” are controversial. EN has generally been favored in modern literature while EE, placed after EN and MM in Bekker’s edition, was often envisaged as inauthentic in the 19th-century (see contra Kenny 1978, along with Natali 2019). The “common books” may have originally belonged to one of the two Ethics and have later been added to the other by editors, or it could be that the two Ethics are already editorial artifacts and that both or none originally contained the common books. If they are included in EN, EN VII.12–14 forms an odd sort of doublet with EN X.1–5, both offering self-contained studies of pleasure. The composition of EN VII / EE VI is in any case problematic, because it is composed of two seemingly unconnected main parts that deal with separate topics (weakness of the will, ch.1–11; pleasure, ch.12–14).

The exact meaning of the adjectives Eudemian and Nicomachean, which function as a pair, in the two traditional titles remains obscure. No ancient list records the two: there is only one Ethics (in five books) in the list of Diogenes Laertius, although some books seem to have circulated independently (On Justice may well be EN V / EE IV), Ptolemy’s list mentions both MM and EE but not EN. The title EN seems to be already known to Cicero, the earliest occurrence of the title EE is apparently found in Ptolemy’s list. “Eudemus” must be Aristotle’s associate Eudemus of Rhodes, “Nicomachus” is either Aristotle’s father, a well-respected doctor, or his son, who died before the age of 21 in battle (both had the same name). The two main hypotheses are (a) that the titles reflect some form of authorship or editorship (which is made difficult by the fact that there is no trace of any philosophical or philological activity undertaken by Aristotle’s father or son) or (b) that each Ethics has been dedicated (by later editors?) to Eudemus and Aristotle’s son (this is the way EE is registered in Ptolemy’s list). Some ancient sources evoke the first hypothesis: Cicero (De finibus V.12) seems to assume that Nicomachus is the author of EN. A commentary by Aspasius is preserved for books I–IV of EN and for the last two “common books”, in which Aspasius wonders whether a passage of EN VII / EE VI could have been written by Eudemus of Rhodes (In EN, 151.18ff.): it might suggest that Aspasius thought that the “common books” originally belonged to EE and that the title indicated that Eudemus had written at least part of them. Later sources are clueless about the meaning of the titles (Olympiodorus, Proleg. 7.34–6) or adopt the second hypothesis (Elias, In Cat. 116.15–9).

Pol. appears in Diogenes’ list in a surprising conjunction with the name of Theophrastus (“lecture on politics like that of Theophrastus’”), which could suggest that he played a part in putting the treatise together, as well as in Hesychius’ and Ptolemy’s without any such indication. It is difficult to make sense of the composition of the treatise which hardly reads like a continuous argument, various alternative orderings of its books have been proposed from the 14th century onward (e.g. by placing books VII and VIII after book III).

3.5 Spuria

The modern Aristotelian corpus includes several works dealing with various topics that are now generally acknowledged as inauthentic, even though ancient writers may have held the opposite view. Most seem to have been produced in the school within a few generations of Aristotle’s activity: Spir. (perhaps found in Ptolemy’s list), Col., Phgn. (perhaps found in Diogenes’ and Hesychius’ lists), Mir. (found in Hesychius’), MM (found in Ptolemy’s), Virt., Oec. (perhaps found in Diogenes’ and Hesychius’). Scholars have contemplated attributing some of them to other figures of the Lyceum, most notably to Theophrastus or Strato. As with some dialogues produced within the Academy which have later come to be transmitted under the name of Plato, these treatises seem to have been aggregated to Aristotle’s works by ancient editors due to their provenience. Ancient scholars were aware of the situation, Neoplatonist commentaries often include a discussion of the authenticity of the treatise at hand. Ammonius, for instance, used to explain the presence of forgeries in the corpus by pointing out (1) that in Hellenistic times, kings used to pay hefty sums of money for new texts for their libraries, prompting some to come up with Aristotelian treatises of their own, (2) that confusion arose when different works had similar titles or one work several titles, and (3) that disciples sometimes put out their own work as having been produced by the master (Müller 1969).

The most obvious case of deliberate forgery is the Rhetoric to Alexander, a compilation of rhetorical treatises roughly contemporary with Aristotle’s Rhet. produced in the second half of the 4th century BCE, prefaced with a forged letter from Aristotle to Alexander the Great. The cases of MXG (corresponding to three separate items in Diogenes’ list and two in Hesychius’), Mund. (found in Ptolemy’s list and often taken to bear traces of Stoic influence) and the Constitution of the Athenians (assumed to be authentic in ancient sources) remain controversial due to a lack of decisive evidence.

Other inauthentic works are further removed from the corresponding original ancient texts. The text of On Things Heard corresponds to several excerpts of a larger treatise quoted by Porphyry in his commentary on Ptolemy’s Harmonics. The Greek text of Plant. is a Renaissance Greek translation of a medieval Latin translation of a 9th-century Arabic translation of a Greek work by Nicolaus of Damascus (dated either to the 1st or 4th century CE) which could still be based on Aristotle’s lost work. A treatise On Plants is mentioned in every ancient list of Aristotle’s works, it has been lost since the time of Alexander of Aphrodisias. Vent. is a fragment of a larger work which is lost.

Probl. and Mech. are both collections that offer disjoint treatments of various problems having to do respectively with natural science and applied mathematics. As similar titles appear in the ancient lists of Aristotle’s works and several cross-references to “problems” are found in the authentic texts, it is possible that parts of the extant Probl. derive from authentic works. The vast collection of Probl. has certainly not been put together haphazardly: it covers a very wide array of issues in which related themes are dealt with in close proximity, although their treatments are by no means mutually consistent and sometimes remain explicitly tentative. The degree of organization still varies greatly across its books, each dealing with a different topic (e.g. book III: wine), some questions end up being treated several times, sometimes within the same book and in inconsistent manners (see e.g. XXXI.12, 13, 18 and 19). At least part of the text can be shown to derive from works by Aristotle, Theophrastus or Strato and must therefore have been composed later. It is likely that the collection does not have a single author and originated in the Lyceum. Mech. is a much shorter collection with a preface and a well-defined subject-matter. Some of the main arguments against its authenticity are the absence of any cross-reference to Mech. in the authentic works, terminological and doctrinal discrepancies (especially about the notion of natural motion), and a reference to a special device, temple wheels (848a23f.), for which there is no attestation outside of Hellenistic Egypt.

Bibliography

A. Primary sources

Standard abbreviations for Aristotle’s works used throughout this entry are listed in Section 1 above.

  • The starting point of modern Aristotelian philology is Bekker’s edition: Bekker, I. Aristotelis Opera, 2 volumes, Berlin: Royal Academy of Prussia, 1831.
  • The standard English translation for Aristotle’s works is the “Revised Oxford Translation” (ROT): Barnes, Jonathan, The Complete Works of Aristotle, 2 volumes, Princeton: Princeton University Press, 1984.
  • References to ancient commentaries (abbreviated as In X, where X is the title of the work of Aristotle on which the commentary bears) are to the editions in the Commentaria in Aristotelem Graeca series, they are gradually being translated in the Ancient Commentators on Aristotle series (Bloomsbury).
  • Ancient lists: Dorandi, Tiziano, “La Vita Hesychii d’Aristote”, Studi Classici e Orientali, 52, 87–106, 2006; Dorandi, Tiziano, Diogenes Laertius. Lives of Eminent Philosophers, Cambridge Classical Texts and Commentaries 50, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 2013; Rashed, Marwan, Ptolémée “al-Gharīb”, Épître à Gallus sur la vie, le testament et les écrits d’Aristote, Collection des Universités de France, Série grecque 557, Paris: Les Belles Lettres, 2021.

B. Works cited

  • Aubenque, Pierre, 1983, “Sur l’inauthenticité du livre K de la Métaphysique” in Zweifelhaftes im Corpus Aristotelicum: Studien zu einigen Dubia. Akten des 9. Symposium Aristotelicum (Berlin, 7–16 September 1981), edited by David J. Furley, Paul Moraux and Jürgen Wiesner, 318–344, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Balme, David M., 1972, De Partibus Animalium I and De Generatione Animalium I: With Passages from II. 1–3, Clarendon Aristotle Series, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • –––, 2002, Aristotle: Historia Animalium: Volume 1, Books I–X: Text, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Baltussen, Han, 2016, The Peripatetics: Aristotle’ Heirs 322 BCE–200 CE, London and New York: Routledge.
  • Barnes, Jonathan, 1997, “Roman Aristotle” in Philosophia Togata II: Plato and Aristotle at Rome, edited by Jonathan Barnes and Miriam Griffin, 1–69, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • –––, 1999, “An introduction to Aspasius” in Aspasius: The Earliest Extant Commentary on Aristotles’s Ethics, edited by A. M. Alberty And R. W. Sharples, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • –––, 2007, “Peripatetic Logic: 100BC–200AD”, Bulletin of the Institute of Classical Studies, 50 (Supplement 94, Part 2): 531–46.
  • Berti, Enrico, 1982, “Note sulla tradizione dei primi due libri della ”Metafisica“ di Aristotele”, Elenchos, 3: 5–37.
  • Bonitz, Hermann, 1870, Index Aristotelicus, Berlin: Georg Reimer.
  • Brunschwig, Jacques, 1981, “L’objet et la structure des Seconds analytiques d’après Aristote”, In Aristotle on Science: The Posterior Analytics. Proceedings of the Eighth Symposium Aristotelicum Held in Padua from September 7 to 15, 1978, edited by Enrico Berti, 61–96, Studia Aristotelica 9, Padova: Antenore.
  • –––, 1989, “Aristote de Stagire. L’Organon: tradition grecque” in Dictionnaire des Philosophes antiques. Volume 1: D’Abam(m)on à Axiothéa, edited by Richard Goulet: 482–502, Paris: CNRS Éditions.
  • –––, 1991, “Qu’est-ce que la Physique d’Aristote ?” in La Physique d’Aristote et les conditions d’une science de la nature, edited by François de Gandt and Pierre Souffrin, 11–40, Bibliothèque d’histoire de La Philosophie, Paris: Vrin.
  • –––, 1994, “Rhétorique et Dialectique, Rhétorique et Topiques” in Aristotle’s “Rhetoric”: Philosophical Essays, edited by David J. Furley and Alexander Nehamas, 57–96, Princeton (N.J.): Princeton University Press.
  • –––, 2004, “On Generation and Corruption I. 1: A False Start?” in Aristotle On Generation and Corruption, Book 1: Symposium Aristotelicum, edited by Frans A. J. de Haas and Jaap Mansfeld, 25–64, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Burnyeat, Myles, 2001, A Map of Metaphysics Zeta, Pittsburgh: Mathesis.
  • –––, 2004, “Aristotelian Revisions: The Case of de Sensu”, Apeiron, 37 (2): 177–80.
  • –––, 2008, “Kinesis vs. Energeia: A Much-Read Passage in (but Not of) Aristotle’s Metaphysics”, Oxford Studies in Ancient Philosophy, 34: 219–91.
  • Crubellier, Michel, 2008, “The Programme of the Aristotelian Analytics” in Dialogues, Logics and Other Strange Things: Essays in Honour of Shahid Rahman, edited by Cédric Dégremont, Shahid Rahman, Laurent Keiff, and Helge Rückert, 121–47, Tributes 7, London: College Publ.
  • Dorandi, Tiziano, 2000, Le Stylet et la Tablette: Dans le secret des auteurs antiques, L’âne d’or 12, Paris: Les Belles Lettres.
  • Eijk, Philip J. van der, 1999, “On Sterility (HA X), A Medical Work by Aristotle?” The Classical Quarterly, 49 (2): 490–502.
  • Fazzo, Silvia, 2010, “Exordes, raccords et ‘titres’ chez Aristote” in Transmettre les savoirs dans les mondes hellénistique et romain, édité par Frédéric Le Blay, 295–308, Histoire, Rennes: Presses universitaires de Rennes.
  • Frede, Michael, 1983, “Titel, Einheit und Echtheit der Aristotelischen Kategorienschrift” in Zweifelhaftes im Corpus Aristotelicum: Studien zu einigen Dubia ; Akten d. 9. Symposium Aristotelicum (Berlin, 7–16 Sept. 1981), edited by Paul Moraux and Jürgen Wiesner, 1–29, Peripatoi 14, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • –––, 1999, “Epilogue” in The Cambridge History of Hellenistic Philosophy, edited by Keimpe Algra, Jonathan Barnes, Jaap Mansfeld, and Malcolm Schofield, 771–97, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • Gerson, Lloyd P, 2005, Aristotle and Other Platonists, Ithaca (N.Y.): Cornell University Press.
  • Gottschalk, Hans B., 1961, “The Authorship of Meteorologica, Book IV”, The Classical Quarterly, 11.1: 67–79.
  • –––, 1987, “Aristotelian Philosophy in the Roman World from the Time of Cicero to the End of the Second Century AD” in Philosophie, Wissenschaften, Technik. Philosophie, edited by Wolfgang Haase, 1079–1175, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Gourinat, Jean-Baptiste, 2013, “La postérité de la classification aristotélicienne des syllogismes aux IIe-IIIe s.: vers un Organon long ?” in Ad Notitiam Ignoti: L’Organon dans La translatio studiorum à l’époque d’Albert Le Grand, edited by Julie Brumberg-Chaumont, 63–114, Studia Artistarum 37, Turnhout: Brepols.
  • Griffin, Michael, 2015, Aristotle’s Categories in the Early Roman Empire, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Harlfinger, Dieter, 1971, “Die Überlieferungsgeschichte der Eudemischen Ethik” in Untersuchungen zur Eudemischen Ethik: Akten des 5. Symposium Aristotelicum (Oosterbeek, Niederlande, 21–29 August 1969), edited by Paul Moraux and Dieter Harlfinger, 1–50, Peripatoi 1, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Hatzimichali, Myrto, 2013, “The Texts of Plato and Aristotle in the First Century BC” in Aristotle, Plato and Pythagoreanism in the First Century BC: New Directions for Philosophy, edited by Malcolm Schofield, 1–27, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press.
  • –––, 2016, “Andronicus of Rhodes and the Construction of the Aristotelian Corpus”, in Brill’s Companion to the Reception of Aristotle in Antiquity, edited by Andrea Falcon, Brill’s Companions to Classical Reception 7, 81–100, Leiden: Brill.
  • Hoffmann, Philippe, 1997, “La problématique du titre des traités d’Aristote selon les commentateurs grecs. Quelques exemples” in Titres et articulations du texte dans les oeuvres antiques: actes du colloque international de Chantilly, 13–15 décembre 1994, Collection des Études augustiniennes 152, Paris: Institut d’études augustiniennes.
  • Jaeger, Werner, 1923, Aristoteles: Grundlegung einer Geschichte seiner Entwicklung, Berlin: Weidmann, English translation by R. Robinson, 1948, Aristotle. Fundamentals of the History of his Development, 2nd ed., Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • Kenny, Anthony, 1978, The Aristotelian Ethics: A Study of the Relationship between the Eudemian and Nicomachean Ethics of Aristotle, Oxford: Clarendon Press.
  • Lefebvre, David, 2016, “Aristotle and the Hellenistic Peripatos: From Theophrastus to Critolaus” in Brill’s Companion to the Reception of Aristotle in Antiquity, edited by Andrea Falcon, Brill’s Companions to Classical Reception 7, 13–34: Leiden: Brill.
  • Maier, Heinrich, 1900, “Die Echtheit der Aristotelischen Hermeneutik”, Archiv für Geschichte der Philosophie, 13 (6): 23–72.
  • Moraux, Paul, 1951, Les Listes anciennes des ouvrages d’Aristote, Louvain: Éditions universitaires de Louvain.
  • –––, 1973, Der Aristotelismus bei den Griechen I: Von Andronikos bis Alexander von Aphrodisias, Peripatoi 5, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • –––, 1984, Der Aristotelismus bei den Griechen II: Der Aristotelismus im I. und II. Jh. n. Chr., Peripatoi 6, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Müller, Carl W., 1969, “Die neuplatonischen Aristoteleskommentatoren über die Ursachen der Pseudepigraphie”, Rheinisches Museum für Philologie, 112 (2): 120–26.
  • Natali, Carlo, 2002, “Il commento di Alessandro di Afrodisia a Meteorologica IV” in Aristoteles Chemicus: Il IV libro dei “Meteorologica” nella tradizione antica e medievale, edited by Cristina Viano, 35–57, International Aristotle Studies 1, Sankt Augustin: Academia Verlag.
  • –––, 2019, “Rivalutare l’Etica Eudemia. A proposito di A. Kenny, The Aristotelian Ethics, II edizione”, Elenchos, 40 (1): 137–64.
  • Perfetti, Stefano, 2000, Aristotle’s Zoology and Its Renaissance Commentators, 1521–1601, Ancient and Medieval Philosophy 27, Leuven: Leuven University Press.
  • Primavesi, Oliver, 2007, “Ein Blick in den Stollen von Skepsis: Vier Kapitel zur frühen Überlieferung des Corpus Aristotelicum”, Philologus, 151 (1): 51–77.
  • –––, 2012, “Introduction: The Transmission of the Text and the Riddle of the Two Versions” in Aristotle’s Metaphysics Alpha: Symposium Aristotelicum, edited by Carlos G. Steel and Oliver Primavesi, Oxford: Oxford University Press.
  • –––, 2024, “Aristoteles und Speusipp über die platonische Zwei-Elementen-Lehre: Metaph. A 6 und die Kommentatoren Asklepios, Proklos und Aspasios”, in Aristoteles-Kommentare und ihre Überlieferung, edited by Christian Brockmann, Daniel Deckers, and Stefano Valente, 1–100, Philosophie der Antike 44, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Rashed, Marwan, 2004, “Agrégat de parties ou vinculum substantiale ? Sur une hésitation conceptuelle et textuelle du corpus aristotélicien” in Aristote et le mouvement des animaux : dix études sur le De motu animalium, edited by André Laks and Marwan Rashed, 185–202, Villeneuve d’Ascq: Presses universitaires du Septentrion.
  • Reinhardt, Tobias, 2000, Das Buch E der Aristotelischen Topik: Untersuchungen zur Echtheitsfrage, Hypomnemata 131, Göttingen: Vandenhoeck & Ruprecht.
  • Veloso, Claudio William, 2018, Pourquoi la «Poétique» d’Aristote ? Diagogè (Histoire des doctrines de l’Antiquité classique 50_, Paris: Vrin.
  • Vuillemin-Diem, Gudrun, 1983, “Anmerkungen zum Pasikles-Bericht und zu Echtheitszweifeln am Größeren und Kleineren Alpha in Handschriften und Kommentaren” in Zweifelhaftes im Corpus Aristotelicum: Studien zu einigen Dubia ; Akten d. 9. Symposium Aristotelicum (Berlin, 7–16 Sept. 1981), edited by Paul Moraux and Jürgen Wiesner, 167–92, Peripatoi 14, Berlin: De Gruyter.
  • Wilamowitz-Moellendorff, Ulrich von, 1881, Antigonos von Karystos, Berlin: Weidmann.

Other Internet Resources

Copyright © 2025 by
Justin Winzenrieth <winzenrieth@phare.normalesup.org>

Open access to the SEP is made possible by a world-wide funding initiative.
The Encyclopedia Now Needs Your Support
Please Read How You Can Help Keep the Encyclopedia Free