Animal Communication

First published Wed Oct 23, 2024

It is intuitive to think that animals communicate. This intuition shapes our everyday interactions with animals, and guides much empirical and theoretical research. Pet owners take their cats’ meows to be requests for food, and interpret their dogs’ play bows as invitations to play. Meanwhile, scholars argue that bees use their dances to communicate information about the location of food, and that the flashing behaviours of fireflies communicate sexual availability to potential mates. But what is animal communication? While it may seem obvious to us that animals communicate, it is more difficult to say what makes their behaviours communicative. Existing theoretical accounts characterise ‘communication’ in different and inconsistent ways.

Biological accounts of animal communication define communicative signals as products of natural selection (Dawkins & Krebs 1978; Maynard Smith & Harper 2003). In the words of Maynard Smith and Harper, signals are:

Any act or structure which [i] alters the behaviour of other organisms, which [ii] evolved because of that effect, and which [iii] is effective because the receiver’s response has also evolved (Maynard Smith and Harper 2003: 3)

On this definition, signals that are not adapted for communication do not count as communicative. This would include the words and sentences of languages (Fröhlich & van Schaik 2020).

Animal signals are sometimes characterised in informational terms, too (Wheeler & Fischer 2012; Scarantino & Clay 2015). Informational frameworks conceptualise communicative interactions as signal-mediated processes of information transmission. In these frameworks, a signal carries ‘information’ about a state if it correlates statistically with that state, such that the occurrence of one thing changes the probability of another (Scarantino 2015). For example, for an eagle alarm call to carry information about the presence of an eagle, the occurrence of eagle alarm calls must reduce uncertainty about the presence of eagles (i.e., make the presence of eagles more likely).

While informational accounts do not place any constraints on what mechanisms govern signal production, voluntary (or ‘intentional’) signal production is a bedrock of human accounts of communication. These include Gricean accounts of communication, which make it a requirement that communicative acts are not only produced voluntarily, but with a distinctive set of intentions (Grice 1957, 1989; Sperber & Wilson 1995; Scott-Phillips 2015). Many events that satisfy the informational definition of a communicative act are not counted as communicative by intentionalist approaches, because they are not voluntarily produced. While some animal signals are produced intentionally, it remains controversial whether they are produced with Gricean intentions (§4.2).

For these reasons, finding a unified theoretical framework for characterising human and animal communication may be less than straightforward (Palazzolo forthcoming). Alternative approaches offer inconsistent accounts of what communication is, and make it hard to say why animal behaviours that look communicative are. Perhaps cases of human and animal communication are examples of a family resemblance notion (Wittgenstein 1953). Were this the case, an all-encompassing characterisation of communication may not be possible, as putatively communicative behaviours may not be united by any set of individually necessary and jointly sufficient conditions. But even here it should be possible to say something about the features of human and animal behaviours that make them similar. We will discuss such attempts in the final part of this essay. Before doing that, because the field has largely been disunited up to now, we give a topographical overview of the ways in which animal communication has been theorised by philosophers and cognitive scientists, and spell out the connections between these approaches. This should give readers a framework for navigating the existing empirical and philosophical literature.

1. Introduction

1.1 Why Study Animal Communication?

Broadly speaking there are two reasons why animal communication is studied: as a way of better understanding human communication, and as a way of understanding animals.

Recent discussions have skewed towards the former approach (Lloyd 2004; Tomasello 2008; Bar-On 2013; Scott-Phillips 2015; Moore 2017a), often motivated by the idea that understanding animal communication can inform the study of language evolution. The idea underlying this research is we can think of animal forms of communication as involving potentially simpler forms of the kinds of communication in which humans engage. Models of the mechanisms that support animal communication might then be used to model how human communication has grown in complexity from its more animalistic origins. Points of continuity and discontinuity, particularly the latter, can be used to help identify what has changed in evolutionary history, and may also give us a basis for reasoning about the conditions that drove the evolution of human features of communication.

Thinking of this project in purely functional terms, modelling the transitions from simple to complex forms of communication, comes with a number of risks. The assumptions that human communication is more complex than animal communication and that human and animal forms of communication are built on the same cognitive foundations may both be false. With increased understanding of the natural world, we are learning that highly complex minds can come in forms very different from our own (Godfrey-Smith 2016). Nonetheless, through the study of common ancestry, we can use models of animal communication to inform the study of human minds.

In the study of phylogenetic development—that is, the biological development and diversification of organisms over historical time—a reasonable assumption is that behaviours present in closely related species were also present in the common ancestor of those species (Sober 2005, 2012). Put another way, if two closely related species share similar traits, it is reasonable to assume that these traits derive from a common ancestral trait, or are ‘homologous’ (Ruse & Travis 2009, Alphabetical guide). While this assumption is defeasible, it’s cladistically more parsimonious to suppose that similar behaviours in closely related species evolved once in an ancestral lineage rather than twice, independently, in later lineages. So if gestural communication is present in all extant great ape species (humans, bonobos, chimpanzees, gorillas, and orangutans), then this is evidence, albeit defeasible, that gestural communication was also present in the last common ancestor of these species around 16mya. The argument from cladistic parsimony generalises to consideration of the mechanisms that support similar behaviours in closely related clades. Where similar behaviours are present in neighbouring clades, then this is evidence (albeit defeasible evidence) that these behaviours are supported by common mechanisms (Sober 2012).

Appeals to common ancestry thus provide a method for reconstructing the phylogenetic development of human communication. Were reconstructing the evolution of human communication the only reason to study animal communication, this would give more reason to study the communication of closely related species, like chimpanzees and bonobos, than more distant ones—like dolphins, dogs, and birds. But if there are similar mechanisms at work in more distantly related species, then we can still gain insight into the potentially phylogenetically ancient foundations of human communication; or into the ways that convergent evolution can support the independent emergence of functionally similar traits in distantly related clades. Such traits may turn out to be ‘analogous’ to those present in the hominin lineage. Unlike homologous traits, analogous traits are similar not because of a shared ancestry, but because, for example, they arose in response to similar environmental pressures (Ruse & Travis 2009, Alphabetical guide).

Of course, self-knowledge is not the only reason to study animal communication. Some philosophers reject the anthropocentrism of thinking that we should study animals to better understand ourselves (Monsó 2021). We may also want to understand animal communication as a means of understanding them—either because doing so is intrinsically interesting, or with some further purpose in mind. When looking at animal communication as a way of understanding animals, the focus is not on the differences and similarities with human communication, but rather on the intrinsic properties of animal communicative systems, minds and behaviours. Studying the communicative interactions that take place within and between animal species in their natural habitats can tell us a great deal about the lives that they live, the ways in which they interact, and the ways in which we might better interact with them. Studying minds radically different from our own can also tell us something about minds in general, and the very different forms that cognition can take.

There may also be practical incentives to study the minds of creatures less closely related to us—not least, for example, domesticated species, and species kept as companion animals. A better understanding of the communication of the animals with whom we share our cities and homes might enable us to improve their living conditions and give them the lives that they deserve (Donaldson & Kymlicka 2011). For example, knowing how to interpret cats’ behaviour, and how cats are likely to interpret us, could enable us to live more harmoniously with them, improving their standard of living, while helping us to build deeper and more meaningful relationships with them. Meanwhile, by better understanding the communication of farm animals, we may better understand when they are suffering and when they are content, facilitating the raising of healthier, happier livestock. Finally, by better understanding the minds of wild animals, we may be better able to educate humankind about the lives they lead, and thus motivate our peers to care about these species. In turn, this might support initiatives designed to protect their natural habits from destruction.

While both human and animal-centric approaches are important, in this entry we will look at animal communication primarily via competing accounts of its differences and similarities with human communication, i.e., within the framework of language evolution. We do not wish to downplay the importance of animal-centric approaches. Rather, the evolutionary approach reflects our own research backgrounds. Furthermore, this comparative approach is the one on which most philosophical debates have focused—and, therefore, which lends itself to a more systematic treatment in a philosophy entry. It also means that, although we try to diversify our examples, many examples are taken from the primate literature. Given our close evolutionary relationship, scholars have often preferred looking to primates to reconstruct the evolution of human language.

1.2 Varying approaches to semantics, syntax, pragmatics and cooperation

This entry is organised into four main sections: semantics, syntax, pragmatics and cooperation.

Since the categories of semantics, syntax and pragmatics are foundational to the study of human communication, we use them to present different accounts of the similarities and differences between human and animal communication. While the meanings of these terms are not always a matter of consensus, in this entry we use them in a manner consistent with the literature on human communication. Thus, semantics is the study of the meaning or information carried by individual signs, as in the study of word meaning (§2). Syntax is the study of the way in which individual signs can be combined into structured, meaningful strings of signs, as when words are combined into sentences (§3). Pragmatics is the study of the ways in which signs are used and interpreted in context. For example, an utterance of the sentence “Leave me alone now” conveys a different proposition, depending on who utters it, and when (§4).

Section 5 focuses on the extent to which animal communication is cooperative, and introduces a series of debates that are key both for understanding recent work on language evolution, and for better understanding interactions between animals.

As will become apparent, the usage of technical terms such as semantics, syntax, pragmatics and cooperation varies considerably in the animal communication literature. This is partly because different subfields of animal communication research have developed independently, and because philosophers and cognitive scientists have used the same words in different ways. Different uses of the same words sometimes also relate to issues of ideology. For example, it may depend on whether an author takes a ‘booster’ or a ‘scoffer’ position (see Andrews & Huss 2014; Andrews & Monsó 2021 for discussion). What we call ‘booster’ views tend to elaborate human-like interpretations of animal behaviours, emphasising similar cognitive abilities in human and non-human species. In contrast, scoffer views lean towards simpler interpretations that emphasise cognitively undemanding processes. Proponents of different approaches often use the same words in different ways, and without acknowledging their idiosyncratic use. This can make navigating the literature in animal communication challenging. In the course of this entry, we’ll illustrate the different ways in which technical terms have been used, and set out to show the relationships between competing views.

2. Semantics

Semantics is the study of the meaning or information carried by individual signs, as in the study of word meaning. A general and vigorously debated approach to the question of animal semantics is to examine what animal signals mean, and whether they could be said to refer.

2.1 Functional reference

The theory of functional reference (Marler, Evans, & Hauser 1992) contends that there is evidence of primitive forms of reference in animal communicative behaviours. ‘Functionally referential’ calls refer to objects or events in the animal’s environment. This makes them possible evolutionary precursors of words. In claiming that animal signals have a referential capacity, the theory of functional reference challenges the classic ‘motivational’ view of animal communication (Darwin 1872 [1998]), according to which animal signals are more like emotional expressions (e.g., laughter, or cries) than words, and have no referential function.

The textbook example of functional reference is the alarm calls of vervet monkeys. As reported by Seyfarth, Cheney, and Marler (1980), vervet monkeys produce three acoustically distinct types of alarm calls in response to three different types of predators: leopards, eagles, and snakes. The receivers of these calls are likely to adopt escape strategies that are consistent with the presence of these predators, as if they interpret the calls to mean “leopard!”, “eagle!” or “snake!”. Leopard alarm calls increase the likelihood that vervet monkeys will run up into trees; eagle alarm calls lead to more individuals looking skywards, before running into bushes; and when they hear snake alarm calls, individuals are more likely to look down and stand bipedally. These behavioural responses are seemingly consistent with vervet calls having some word-like referential capacity.

Within the theory of functional reference, the referentiality of animal signals is defined as “functional” in the sense of being neutral about the mental processes that support animal calls (Marler, Evans, & Hauser 1992). What makes functionally referential animal signals similar to words—and, potentially, their evolutionary precursors—is the fact that they are taken by their recipients to stand for objects or events in the environment. Since claims about functional reference are neutral with respect to the mechanisms that support call production, this theoretical framework can be used to study the various ways in which animals provide members of their own and other species with information about their shared environment. Thus it is a valuable tool for studying communication between animals. It is also well suited for characterising the findings of observational (e.g., ethological) studies, which may be ill-suited to supporting conclusions about the mechanisms underlying communication.

According to early formulations of the functional reference view, animal signals are functionally referential when they are (i) stimulus-specific—i.e., produced by animals in response to specific objects or events in the environment (the ‘production criterion’); and (ii) context-independent—i.e., capable of eliciting appropriate responses in the recipients in the absence of contextual clues (the ‘perception criterion’) (Marler, Evans, & Hauser 1992; Macedonia & Evans 1993). However, both the formulation of these criteria and the general utility of the functional reference framework have been challenged.

2.1.1 Criticisms of functional reference

The theory of functional reference has been challenged by a number of scholars (e.g., Rendall, Owren, & Ryan 2009; Wheeler & Fischer 2012; Scarantino 2013). Wheeler and Fischer (2012) develop a two-part objection. First, based on empirical evidence they suggest that functional referential signals are at best a marginal phenomenon in animal communication. In most cases, they argue, animal signals are neither stimulus-specific nor context-independent: animals tend to produce the same types of signals in response to different stimuli (making them non-stimulus-specific); and communicative signals are usually interpreted by animals in light of contextual clues (making them non-context-independent). Ironically, they argue that stimulus-specificity does not even seem to apply to vervet monkeys’ alarm calls, because only calls given by males are well characterised by the hypothesis that there are three distinct types of alarm calls (Price et al. 2015). Second, Wheeler and Fischer argue that even where signals are functionally referential, often they are not voluntarily produced—undermining the proposal that they are an evolutionary precursor of linguistic signs (see also Fischer & Price 2017). This view is supported by neurological evidence suggesting that primates may lack the neural system which is responsible for voluntary vocal control in humans (Fischer & Hammerschmidt 2020). In light of these objections Wheeler and Fischer argue that animal psychologists should overcome their preoccupation with functional reference and instead search for continuities between human and non-human communication in the interpretation, not the production, of signals. They propose to abandon the functional reference framework in favour of a receiver-centred approach to animal semantics (see §4.1).

2.1.2 In defence of functional reference

Against Wheeler & Fischer (2012), Scarantino (2013) and Scarantino & Clay (2015) defend the explanatory value of the functional reference framework. They argue that the problem is not with the framework itself, but only with the existing characterisation of functional reference. They point out that while context-independence and stimulus-specificity don’t always apply to cases of animal communication, they don’t apply to cases of human linguistic reference, either. Examples of this include indexicals like ‘I’ and ‘you’, ‘today’ and ‘tomorrow’, and ‘this’ and ‘that’. Such terms are produced in a variety of circumstances, and so lack stimulus-specificity. Their interpretation therefore requires taking into account contextual clues. Regardless, indexicals have a referential function. This shows that referential capacity is not dependent upon either stimulus specificity or context-independence. Scarantino argues that the failure of animal signals to meet these criteria is therefore insufficient to show that they do not refer, and no reason to deny that such signals could be evolutionary precursors of words.

Scarantino also argues that animal signals don’t need to be stimulus-specific to be adaptive. This is because the cost of false positive calls (e.g., calls given in the absence of a predator) may be much less costly than false negatives (signals not given in the presence of predator). For example, a receiver who responds to a false-positive eagle alarm call with eagle-avoidance behaviour does not incur damaging costs. It is more risky not to engage in eagle-avoidance behaviour when an eagle is present. Thus, in many cases it will be adaptive if eagle calls are given to stimuli other than eagles.

Drawing on the example of indexicals, Scarantino (2013) proposes a revised characterisation, according to which

Signals can functionally refer by virtue of contextual cues … and in the absence of a strong correlation with their referents …. (Scarantino 2013: 1012)

Unlike the original production criterion (Macedonia & Evans 1993), Scarantino’s ‘contextual information criterion’ admits weak correlations between signals and referents, allowing signals to be produced in a variety of circumstances, rather than being stimulus-specific. On this formulation, a signal X carries information about a state Y iff “Xs are correlated with Ys (weakly or strongly)” (Scarantino 2013: 1014). In contrast to Macedonia & Evans’ (1993) perception criterion, Scarantino also suggests a ‘contextual perception criterion’, according to which:

X’s presentations in context C reliably cause responses adaptive to Ys in the absence of Ys.

He argues that calls functionally refer to things if they statistically correlate with them, and if receivers have developed an adaptive response to that correlation. This means that animal behaviours functionally refer only if recipients respond to them in ways that are adaptive. This is also possible via the integration of contextual clues, in contrast to Macedonia and Evans (1993).

On this approach, functional reference becomes a modified form of ‘natural meaning’ (Grice 1957; Scarantino 2015). On Grice’s account, something X naturally means that Y if the presence of Xs entails the presence of Ys. Against Grice, Scarantino argues that it is sufficient for X to naturally mean Y that it reliably indicates the presence of Y. Thus he presents ‘natural meaning’ as a statistical relationship between two states of affairs (Scarantino 2015)—e.g., a call, and the thing to which that call is a response. Signals carry information about the states with which their production is associated, and the probability of which is changed by the occurrence of the calls (i.e., uncertainty reduction). For example, the probability of an eagle being present is raised by an eagle alarm call, such that the latter carries predictive information about (or reduces uncertainty about) the presence of the former. Significantly, Scarantino’s theory of information is neutral about what mechanisms underpin these correlations. The change in probability occurs regardless of what psychological processes govern the production of signals.

Scarantino’s revised account remains controversial. Wheeler and Fischer (2015) object that his rehabilitated characterisation is too broad to be useful in the study of language evolution, because many intuitively non-communicative features of animals can potentially statistically correlate with states of affairs in a context, and elicit adaptive responses, such that they could be said to refer to them (see Palazzolo 2024 for discussion).

Despite their differences, Wheeler and Fischer’s framework of meaning attribution and Scarantino’s revised account of functional reference are united in one important respect: they both argue that the interpretation of signals that are not produced voluntarily can serve as a point of continuity between human and animal communication, and thus is of value for the study of language evolution. In section 4.1, we discuss criticism of this claim by some philosophers (Bar-On & Moore 2017; Bar-On 2021).

Whether or not it identifies a significant point of continuity with linguistic reference, it should be noted that the framework of functional reference has been very productive in animal communication research. Forms of functional reference have been discovered in a wide range of animal species, including monkeys, prairie dogs, meerkats, chickens and bees (see Townsend & Manser 2013; Gill & Bierema 2013). Since the studies of von Frisch (1965 [1967]), for example, it has been observed that bees’ waggle dances communicate information about the direction, distance and abundance of a food source with respect to the hive. Additionally, prairie dogs have been shown to use four alarm call variants that vary consistently with different predator types, including hawks, humans, coyotes, and dogs. Alarm calls also vary based on specific physical attributes of the predator (Slobodchikoff et al. 2009). While these findings would not support claims about the psychological states of call producers, they can be classified as functionally referential without fear of misrepresenting the minds of their producers. Moreover, regardless of the mechanisms underlying these interactions, the functional reference framework has been used to show that many animal communication systems are used to provide receivers with information about the environment.

2.2 Do animals know the meaning of words?

Whether or not the concept of functional reference can be rehabilitated for the study of language evolution, some have argued that, for at least some species, animal researchers may have no need for it (Palazzolo 2024)—because the animal kingdom contains cases of reference proper. If that is right, we can look to these cases to better understand the origins of linguistic reference. Here ‘reference proper’ means signals that are under the voluntary control of agents, and are used to refer to objects in the environment. Such signals may indicate a capacity to refer that is shared with humans, and potentially evidence for word-like signals in animal communication.

In the discussion that follows we use examples not only of cases where animal signals seem to refer, but also cases where animal signals seem to be used with stable meanings comparable to the words of a natural language. This approach mirrors one found in the animal communication literature, where cases of potential reference have been subsumed into broader debates about whether animals can know the meanings of words. If animals do not know the meanings of words, then they cannot use them to refer. However, whether animals understand word meanings will depend on what this knowledge of meaning entails, and as the following section will make clear, this is not a matter of consensus.

2.2.1 Arguments for animal knowledge of meaning

Intuitively compelling cases of animal reference can be found in both word-like features of the communicative repertoires of wild animals, and in the communicative systems of animals reared in human environments. With respect to the former, wild populations of great apes use their gestures with stable semantic properties. The purported meanings of these gestures have been studied and compiled (e.g., Hobaiter & Byrne 2014). Since great ape gestures are paradigmatically used to talk about actions (e.g., to make utterances like “Stop!” or “Groom me!”), these gestures figure less in debates about reference, because the term ‘reference’ is used by comparative psychologists only where signs are noun-like. (In contrast, philosophers use the term with a broader and more technical scope—as when describing the reference of a proposition in terms of its truth value.) Nonetheless, these gestures are also candidates for having meanings in the same manner as words.

Potential cases of knowledge of meaning have also been identified in animals who interact regularly with humans, including great apes trained to use and understand either sign-language (Fouts & Fouts 1993), or specially adapted lexigrams (Savage-Rumbaugh, Shanker, et al. 1998); a parrot, Alex, who has demonstrated a remarkable aptitude for using and understanding human words (Pepperberg 1981); and a dog, Rico, who can seemingly understand hundreds of human words, including object names (Kaminski, Call, & Fischer 2004).

Enculturated animals are raised in human-like environments and given species-atypical exposure to human interaction (see Berio & Moore 2023, for discussion). While enculturation projects have met with mixed success (contrast Terrace 2019 with Fouts & Fouts 1993), some have presented highly impressive findings of the communicative development of great apes (e.g., Savage-Rumbaugh 1986; Savage-Rumbaugh, Shanker, & Taylor 1998). For example, the bonobo Kanzi was raised in an environment where he interacted daily with human researchers led by Sue Savage-Rumbaugh. While Kanzi was not taught to use lexigrams (symbols on a keyboard that when pressed play the sounds of words), he learned to do so at a young age by watching his human caregivers’ unsuccessful attempts to teach his adoptive mother. He can reportedly understand a couple of thousand words of English (although some counting methods report lower numbers (Call 2011), and he communicates fluently using a lexigram board that contains around 450 signs, using perhaps 30–40 of these daily in the production of his own utterances (Savage-Rumbaugh 1986). These cases raise the questions of whether animals can understand the meanings of words; and what this understanding consists in.

2.2.1 Arguments against animal knowledge of meaning

One possible answer to the question “Do animals know the meanings of words?” is given by Berwick and Chomsky (2016). On their view, animals cannot understand word meanings, because what constitutes meaning is the mapping of a sign to a concept. They argue that since chimpanzees lack a human-like conceptual system, they cannot map signs to concepts in the required way, and so cannot know the meanings of words. While they don’t say much about what they take concept possession to consist in, they support their argument by citing an early study by Petitto and colleagues (2005), which discusses Nim, a chimpanzee who was raised by Terrace and colleagues in a human environment, where he was taught to use American Sign Language. Petitto argues that although Nim could produce the gestures he was trained to use:

Nim didn’t actually learn about words, and didn’t even have the human concept for “apple”. For Nim, an “apple” was the object associated with the knife in the draw that cut the apple, the place that apples were found, and so on[.] (Berwick & Chomsky 2016: 146)

They also cite approvingly the work of Petitto (Petitto 2005: 85–87), who argues that Nim’s patterns of word-use show that “chimps do not really have names for things at all … only a hodge-podge of loose associations” (ibid.). If Nim had no concept of apple, then he could not know the meaning of the gesture ‘apple’, since this requires a form-concept mapping.

Berwick and Chomsky’s (2016) argument deserves a more substantial engagement than can be attempted here. Still, in response to it, two points are worth making. First, some philosophers have argued that animals do have conceptual knowledge (Glock 2000; Finkelstein 2007), even if the contents of their concepts differ from our own. If this is right, an account of knowledge of meaning grounded in concept possession might plausibly be defended for animal communicators. Second, the conclusion that Nim’s gestures show his concepts to be un-human-like seems to be motivated at least in part by his producing gestures in seemingly inappropriate contexts—for example, by gesturing ‘apple’ in the presence of a knife. This raises questions about how behaviours and concepts should be connected. Even if there were a consensus view of what concept possession consists in (and there is not), an account of the kinds of gestural behaviour that would constitute evidence of the concept possession needed for knowledge of meaning is independent of this. Berwick and Chomsky don’t consider what patterns of sign-use would indicate knowledge of meaning, but without an answer to this question, it’s unclear what Nim’s verbal behaviour shows.

While the view that knowledge of meaning consists of knowing a word-concept mapping is popular among cognitive scientists (e.g., Bloom 2000), it is less central to philosophical accounts of meaning—not least because questions about the relationship between language-use and concept possession can seem prohibitively difficult to answer. Some philosophers of language have instead tended to equate knowledge of meaning with knowing how to use words to pursue certain kinds of communicative goals, and understanding others’ uses of words. For example, Wittgenstein famously held that “for a large class of cases … the meaning of a word is its use in the language” (1953: 43). This has often been taken to entail that knowing the meaning of a word consists in knowing how to use it—something that could seemingly be granted to animals who know how to use words to fulfil their communicative goals. On such an account, there may be no reason to deny knowledge of meaning to at least some animals. For example, Nim’s voluntarily gesturing a sign for “Apple” when looking at a knife used to cut apples need not be evidence of a confused concept of apple, so much as a case of a hungry chimpanzee requesting an object in its absence (“I want an apple!”). (This ability for absent reference was, until recently, taken to be uniquely human—although it has now been identified in chimpanzees (Lyn et al. 2014; Bohn, Call, & Tomasello 2015).)

A similar explanation of knowledge of meaning also can be identified in the work of Grice (1989), who argued that for a word to have a ‘standing’ (i.e., conventional) meaning is for communicators to use that word to express certain kinds of communicative intentions. Currently influential approaches to identifying the meanings of great ape gestures draw influence from Gricean and Wittgensteinian approaches, by identifying their meanings of great ape gestures with the goals with which these gestures are produced. In turn, the content of the communicative goal is inferred from the agent’s apparent satisfaction with the results of their gesturing (see Hobaiter & Byrne 2014). While legitimate questions arise about whether animals can be credited with the ability to express communicative intentions (see §4.2), if they can, it’s not clear what further reasons one might have for denying them knowledge of meaning—even if their utterances indicate no evidence of syntax, phonology, morphology, or myriad other features of human language (contra Petitto 2005).

Perhaps some would object that specifying knowledge of meaning without reference to concept possession is also problematic. At least implicitly, Terrace (2019), director of the Nim project, raises such a concern. He worries that agents who lack concepts could nonetheless use words to manipulate others, without understanding them, in the same way that one might manipulate the keys on a keyboard to guide a character in a computer game. Such concerns motivate him to deny that Nim knew the meanings of words. He argues that manipulation is particularly likely in the kinds of requesting behaviour in which chimpanzees engage, because words are here very closely tied to behaviour (like the receipt of an object). This leads to a pattern in which creatures can uncomprehendingly repeat words, without knowing their meanings, because they are rewarded for doing so. He argues that an ability to use words to share information about or interest in something would be better evidence of knowledge of meaning, since in such cases there is no direct reward for uttering. This raises another problem, though. For all that we might like such evidence, chimpanzees seem to be largely unmotivated to communicate solely to share information (see §5). This doesn’t entail they lack knowledge of word meaning though. It shows only that our basis for attributing to them knowledge of meaning lacks one compelling kind of evidence.

Our view is that the arguments for denying knowledge of word meanings to non-human great apes are unpersuasive. Nonetheless, we don’t propose to settle the question of whether animals know the meanings of words here. Rather, we acknowledge that this area of research would benefit from further philosophical attention.

3. Syntax

3.1 What is syntax?

In the literature on human communication, syntax refers to the ability to combine meaningful semantic units (like words) into larger, meaningful strings with a hierarchical structure (like sentences). This capacity is critical to human communication, and it underpins much of its characteristic expressive power. It’s thanks to our capacity to combine words into sentences that we can express an unimaginably large number of different thoughts using a limited set of linguistic elements.

The prevailing view in the literature on language evolution holds that the capacity for syntax is uniquely human. Berwick & Chomsky (2016), for example, argue that syntax distinguishes our minds from the minds of animals. On their view, syntax (which they sometimes call ‘language’) is not specifically a feature of communication, but of thought. They argue that, unlike animal minds, human minds possess concepts (although what they mean by ‘concepts’ is not entirely clear). These concepts are said to be bound together using syntactic rules, to create hierarchically organised thoughts. Thoughts can then be ‘externalised’ via the ‘sensorimotor interface’ (the system for producing and understanding speech), for the purposes of communication. Nonetheless, on their view syntax is a feature of thought, which underwent natural selection for its role in thought and planning, independently of any communicative function.

According to Berwick and Chomsky (2016), human syntax is made possible by a computational ability, Merge, which combines two objects (a, b) to generate a structure {a, b}. Merge incorporates two operations: it combines elements, and imposes a hierarchical structure on them, which in turn constrains the interpretation of the string. To say that Merge imposes hierarchical structure means that its outputs are rule-governed compositions in which units modify some units but not others. For example, in a phrase like ‘very old house’, ‘very’ modifies ‘old’ but not ‘house’: [[very old] house]. A string of units is hierarchical, in other words, if some units within that string are grouped together with some other units, to form a larger unit within the string—for example, when words are bound into noun phrases, which can be combined with verbs to make sentences. Hierarchical structure is often contrasted with linear order, since the binding of hierarchical elements need not correspond to the order in which they occur in a sequence (see §3.3 for discussion).

The outputs of Merge are also taken to be in principle unbounded, which means that there is no principled limit to the number of combinations that can be produced. There may be practical limits on the complexity of the hierarchical structures agents can represent, because of limitations on their working memory or attention. However, these are considered to be failures of performance, and not a reflection on the underlying combinatorial competence, which is unbound in its capacity to combine elements (Chomsky 1980).

3.2 The production of syntactically complex signals by animals

The literature on animal communication identifies three different types of combinations in wild animal communication systems: ‘phonological syntax’, ‘combinatorial syntax’ and ‘compositional syntax’ (Hurford 2012).

Phonological syntax is a rule-based combination of units without meaning. For instance, studies have shown that Bengalese finches and Nightingales exhibit specific patterns in the arrangement of their song elements, although these elements do not seem to possess semantic information (Berwick, Okanoya, et al. 2011).

Combinatorial syntax is a combination of meaningful units where the meaning of the whole is not a function of the meanings of its parts. An example of combinatorial syntax in animals is putty-nosed monkeys’ ‘pyow-hack’ sequences (Arnold & Zuberbühler 2012). Putty-nosed monkeys use pyows as terrestrial alarm calls and hacks as eagle alarm calls. When they are used in sequence they elicit group travel. Since group travel seems to be unrelated to the individual meanings of hacks and pyows, pyow-hack messages seem not to be constructed using the semantic features of these constituent calls. Rather, it seems like the putty-nosed monkeys have a limited call repertoire and have found a way to combine two calls from that limited repertoire to convey a third, unrelated message.

Compositional syntax is a combination of meaningful units where the meaning of the whole depends on the meanings of its parts and—according to classical views of syntax—the way the parts are syntactically combined. It is compositional syntax that characterises the sentences of natural languages, and evidence of which in animals would best demonstrate the similarity of animal and human forms of communication.

Suzuki and colleagues argue that they have found evidence of such abilities in Japanese tits, whose ‘ABC-D’ calls are thought to meet the criteria for compositional syntax (Suzuki, Wheatcroft, & Griesser 2018). In Japanese tits, ‘ABC’ calls are general alert calls, with a meaning akin to [/threat!/]. ‘D’ calls serve to recruit group members (e.g., [/come here!/]). ‘ABC-D’ calls, together, form mobbing sequences: these sequences are used by Japanese tits to recruit conspecifics to mob a stationary predator, and are responded to by conspecifics by gradually approaching the sender and scanning the surrounding environment. Based on this evidence, Suzuki and colleagues conclude that the compound meaning of ‘ABC-D’ calls is directly connected to the meanings of its parts, being something akin to ‘ABC-D’ = [/threat!/ + /come here!/]. Moreover, they consider the fact that Japanese tits do not respond to reversed, artificial ‘D-ABC’ sequences as evidence that they are sensitive to the order of the calls, and that the calls have a hierarchical structure.

In terms of understanding the evolution of human syntax, compositional syntax is thought to be the most relevant form of animal combination. However, a debate exists in the literature about the similarity of putative cases in animals and humans. Proponents of ‘scoffer’ accounts, such as Bolhuis et al. (2018), downplay the significance of seemingly compositional syntax in animals, arguing that these cases are qualitatively distinct from human syntax. Against Bolhuis and colleagues, Townsend, Engesser, et al. (2018) argue that animal compositional combinations are the evolutionary precursors of human syntax.

This disagreement is motivated by different views of what is essential to syntax. Bolhuis et al. (2018) count hierarchy and unbounded generativity as essential features of human syntax, and argue that there is no evidence of these features in animal combinations. They claim that animal combinations lack internal structure (i.e., they are nothing more than just ‘summations’ of individual meanings), and that while human syntax is unbounded in its nature, animal signals are fixed and limited in their combinatorial possibilities. That’s because, while sentences of natural languages can be bound indefinitely (for example, by conjoining any number of sentences with ‘and’), there is very little evidence of long strings of signals in the animal kingdom (i.e., there is no evidence of boundless Merge). For example, more sober analyses of the utterances produced by enculturated chimpanzees suggest that for the most part they produce strings of only two or three gestures or symbols (Rivas 2005). Other data suggest that there is no combinatorial use of gestures by wild chimpanzees (Hobaiter & Byrne 2011). However, against Bolhuis and colleagues, we would point out that while data show limited evidence of complex combinatoriality in great apes, this is not a valid basis from which to conclude that human communication alone is characterised by boundless combinatoriality. That’s because such a claim turns on an illegitimate comparison of performance and competence (Chomsky 1980). That is, it turns on a comparison of what humans can do in principle (but not in practice) with what animals can do in practice. This is not a comparison of like with like. A more cautious conclusion would hold just that there is no evidence of hierarchical syntax or complex combinatoriality (that is, long and varied strings of signs) in non-human species.

Against such a sceptical view, Townsend, Engesser, and colleagues (2018) have argued that there is more continuity between compositionality in animals and human syntax than has often been assumed. However, this account is based on a weaker understanding of what human syntax requires. On this view, syntactic structures can include combinations of semantic elements in which the meanings of the whole are determined by the meanings of the parts, but where the parts need not be hierarchically structured. The capacity for combining units also need not be unbounded to qualify as syntactic. According to Townsend and colleagues, the absence of hierarchy and generativity in animal combinations does not pose a significant challenge for continuity claims, because human language also contains examples of non-hierarchical and non-generative structures which, they claim, are nonetheless intuitively syntactic. Townsend et al. illustrate their claim by providing examples of phrases like ‘duck and cover’, which they take to be non-hierarchical, and ‘gimme a break’, which they take to be non-generative, since it is ordinarily not embedded into longer syntactic strings. Using these criteria, Townsend et al. argue that there is evidence of syntax in Pied babblers (Engesser, Ridley, &, Townsend 2016), Japanese tits (Suzuki, Wheatcroft, & Griesser 2018), and potentially in chimpanzees (Leroux et al. 2023). However, whether one is satisfied by this argument will depend on whether or not one is willing to accept the accompanying arguments for lowering the threshold of what counts as evidence of syntax.

Even if one is willing to accept a lower threshold for evidence of syntax, Schlenker, Coye, and colleagues (2023; see also Schlenker, Chemla, et al. 2016) argue that many purported cases of compositional syntax in animals can be given deflationary interpretations. For example, they argue that call sequences like the ABC-D calls found in Japanese tits (Suzuki, Wheatcroft, & Griesser 2018) can be viewed as separate, successive utterances, rather than as complex syntactic units. Schlenker and colleagues (Schlenker, Coye, et al. 2023) refer to such cases as possessing only “trivial compositionality”.

In cases of trivial compositionality, Schlenker and colleagues argue that the meaning of animal sequences can be explained not by appeal to syntactic rules, but by instead appealing to pragmatic mechanisms of competition among signals—which they characterise in terms of Informativity and Urgency principles. The Informativity principle establishes that more informative utterances should be preferred over less informative utterances (Schlenker, Chemla, et al. 2016: 19). The Urgency principle is a variant of the Informativity principle and

mandates that calls that provide information about the nature/location of a threat … must come before calls that don’t. (Schlenker, Chemla, et al. 2016: 33)

According to Schlenker, Chemla, et al. (2016: 37), the Urgency principle explains, for example, why a sequence of pyows followed by a small number of hacks (i.e., pyow-hack sequences) signals group movement in putty-nosed monkeys. Given that, if there was an eagle, hacks would have come first in the sequence, the fact that they don’t suggests that the non-ground movement signalled by the sequence is non-threat related and thus, most likely, group movement. Bar-On has recently criticised some aspects of this proposal (Bar-On forthcoming).

3.3 The comprehension of syntactically complex signals by animals

If evidence of syntactic complexity in wild animals is underwhelming, findings drawn from the study of enculturated great apes may prove to be more compelling. As previously discussed (see §2.2), studies of the communicative abilities of enculturated chimpanzees and bonobos have consistently found that they produce strings of signs; and are capable of understanding longer strings of human speech. While studies of utterance production by Kanzi and others show an ability to produce strings of two or three signs that are seemingly more complex than anything seen in wild apes, they present no evidence of hierarchical syntax (Berio & Moore 2023). However, although Kanzi does not produce grammatically structured utterances, he can track relatively subtle grammatical differences. In a detailed study of Kanzi’s ability to understand syntactic complexity, Savage-Rumbaugh, Murphy, and colleagues (1993) report that in testing he responded differentially to utterances that were semantically similar but syntactically different (see Truswell 2017, for discussion). This includes utterances like:

  1. Put the tomato in the oil.
  2. Put some oil in the tomato.

In cases like the former, Kanzi is reported to have put the tomato in the oil as requested; and in the latter, to have poured oil into a bowl with the tomato. Truswell has recently argued that these data suggest that Kanzi tracks not only the semantic properties of utterances, but also syntax-relevant properties like linear order (Truswell 2017). However, he also shows that Kanzi struggles with some simple, non-linear grammatical forms, where word order is not sufficient to generate correct interpretations of the sentence. For example, when asked to ‘Fetch the tomato and the oil’, Kanzi typically brings only one or the other. Truswell argues that this shows that Kanzi is unable to understand hierarchical syntactic relations like binding two nouns to the same verb (2017). That is, he cannot represent the internal structure of sentences, where this differs from the order of words in those sentences. Rather, he just decodes words in the order they are presented.

This finding suggests that humans have a capacity for hierarchical syntax that may not be possessed by even enculturated great apes. It also raises the question of whether there is evidence of any ability to master non-linear grammars in any animal species. In this context an early study on captive bottlenose dolphins (Herman, Richards, & Wolz 1984) provides stronger evidence for hierarchical processing. In this study, two bottlenose dolphins were instructed in an artificial language to perform specific actions in relation to named objects and modifiers. While one dolphin was trained in the use of a linear grammar (‘A take to B’), the other was trained to use a non-linear grammar (e.g., ‘to B, A take’ rather than ‘A take to B’). Since the dolphin was able to master these constructions, albeit imperfectly, it may be that dolphins are not limited to tracking linear order. However, since this is a single study of one animal, it is possible to draw only limited conclusions about what it shows. This is especially so since Herman’s study does not report in full the sentences on which dolphins were tested, making a more detailed analysis of its performance impossible.

Thus, for now, it can be concluded only that there is no real evidence of any ability for hierarchical syntax in the animal kingdom, either in the production or in the comprehension of utterances. More studies will be needed before strong conclusions can be drawn. Nonetheless, in recent years a clear set of theoretical frameworks have emerged within which putative cases of syntactic complexity can be studied and evaluated. Methods for operationalising these theoretical insights, and testing hypotheses empirically, are still being developed.

4. Pragmatics

The study of pragmatics relates to the use and interpretation of meaningful signs. However, what exactly this is taken to mean is controversial.

4.1 Carnapian pragmatics

As noted in the discussion of functional reference (see §2.1), animal vocal signals have often been thought non-voluntarily produced, and so crucially unlike language-use (Tomasello 2008; Wheeler & Fischer 2012). Consequently, language evolution researchers have sometimes maintained that these signals are uninteresting from the perspective of language evolution research. Others have argued that we can nonetheless find an analogue of some features of language in the context-dependent interpretation of signals, whether or not these are voluntarily produced (Wheeler & Fischer 2012). Such cases might be treated as instances of pragmatic interpretation. Since many (e.g., Tomasello 2008; Scott-Phillips 2017; Moore 2017a) have hypothesised that pragmatics plays a foundational role in the evolution of language, studying the pragmatic features of animal communication might shed light not only upon interactions between animals, but language origins too. This view has been defended not only by Wheeler & Fischer (2012), but by Scarantino (2017; Scarantino & Clay 2015).

Scarantino’s ‘Theory of Affective Pragmatics’ “focuses on what emotional expressions mean in a context” (Scarantino 2017: 166; see also Scarantino, Hareli, & Hess 2022), and the ways in which emotional expressions direct others’ behaviours, allowing for analogues of descriptive, commissive, imperative and expressive speech acts. He argues that in the non-verbal communication of humans and animals, emotional expressions play a richer proto-linguistic role than previously acknowledged: “much of what we can do with language we can also do with nonverbal emotional expressions” (2017: 165). On his view, an angry frown in the appropriate context can amount to describing a target behaviour as unacceptable, demanding that the behaviour stop, and as expressing disappointment, among other things. By showing how emotional expressions can perform the function of illocutionary force (for example, by showing whether an utterance conveys a request or an order), Scarantino proposes to contribute to an explanation of language evolution, by showing how key elements of speech act theory are already present in the animal kingdom.

Scarantino’s approach emphasises studying the contextual interpretation of animal signals for understanding the evolution of language. It is part of a body of pragmatics-influenced work on language evolution that has been labelled ‘Carnapian pragmatics’, after the philosopher Rudolf Carnap. As Bar-On and Moore define it, Carnapian pragmatics

is the study of the variation (and derivation) of the significance of sentence (or signal) types with the context of production. (Bar-On & Moore 2017: 296)

Proponents of Carnapian pragmatics (e.g., Seyfarth & Cheney 2003; Fitch 2010; Wheeler & Fischer 2012; Arnold & Zuberbühler 2013; Scarantino & Clay 2015; Seyfarth & Cheney 2017) argue that the informational contents of animal signals are context-dependent, in the same manner as linguistic terms like indexicals. For example, putty-nosed monkeys produce eagle alarm calls (‘hacks’) in the presence of eagles, but they also produce these calls in non-predatory situations, such as in response to falling trees and baboon fights (Arnold & Zuberbühler 2013). When eagle calls are given in these non-predatory contexts, putty-nosed monkeys do not respond by enacting characteristic flee behaviours (as they would for eagles), suggesting that the informational contents of eagle calls are different in different contexts, and that receivers integrate contextual information in interpreting the calls. Scarantino and Clay (2015) identify four main categories of the kinds of contextual clues they think likely influence the interpretation of animal communication:

  1. identity cues, which contain information about the identity of the signaller (e.g., status, age, kinship, reliability);
  2. behavioural cues, which contain information about the activity of the signaller during signal production (e.g., gaze and body orientation);
  3. environmental cues, which contain information about events occurring in the environment; and
  4. sequence-placement cues, which contain information about the signal sequence (e.g., other signals produced in adjacent periods of time).

The concept of information at work in Carnapian pragmatics corresponds to a loose version of Grice’s notion of natural meaning (Grice 1957; Scarantino 2015; see §2.1). It is the kind of meaning that allows us to make inferences about some parts of the world based on our perception of other parts. On Scarantino’s account, identity cues (like the pitch of a caller’s voice) might (naturally) mean that a call is being given by one member of a group, rather than others; and contextually salient behavioural cues, like the caller’s line of sight at the time of the call, naturally indicate that the call was produced in response to some features of the environment, rather than others.

Different versions of Carnapian pragmatics make different claims about the role of information in guiding the contextually variant responses of the animals who perceive and interpret signs. Information can be used either as a proximate or as an ultimate explanatory construct (Kalkman 2017; Mayr 1961). As a proximate explanatory construct, information is something that recipients represent on a psychological level, explaining how recipients respond to communicative signals. As an ultimate explanatory construct, information accounts for the evolution of recipients’ responses, without necessarily being psychologically represented by them. In other words, when information plays an ultimate explanatory role, the fact that signals correlate with, i.e., carry information about, determinate states of affairs explains why determinate responses have been selected. Whereas according to Wheeler and Fischer (Wheeler & Fischer 2012) animals respond to communicative signals by mentally representing the signals’ informational contents, Scarantino thinks the information extracted is not necessarily psychologically represented by animals (Scarantino 2013, 2017; Scarantino & Clay 2015).

There are theoretical benefits of a Carnapian pragmatic approach to animal communication and language evolution. It can explain communicative interactions between animal communicators, and identifies continuities between animal and human communication even where the mechanisms of signal production in animals and humans differ. Some scholars have nonetheless criticised the relevance of Carnapian pragmatics to language evolution research. According to Bar-On and Moore (2017; Bar-On 2021; Moore 2017d), Carnapian pragmatics fails to isolate the right point of continuity with language to constitute a foundation for language evolution research. They argue that if we accept that language develops on the back of a capacity to act with and interpret intentionally communicative behaviour, it is unclear how we can hope to shed light on its evolution by focusing on a notion of meaning—natural meaning—the interpretation of which may implicate quite difference psychological processes from those needed for the interpretation of communicative goals. Bar-On (2021) argues that Carnapian pragmatics sets the explanatory bar too low. Context-dependent interpretation, she argues, marks continuity between animal and human communication, but this continuity “seems hardly sufficient by itself to illuminate the origins of distinctively human communication” (Bar-On 2021: 4), since the sense in which animals are said to extract information from communicative signals is the same in which a person extracts information about fire from (non-communicative) signs of smoke. In that case, she argues, work on Carnapian pragmatics in animal communication cannot tell us much about the evolution of language—at least if we think that language evolution required the interpretation of specifically communicative acts.

4.2 Gricean pragmatics

Some authors have adopted a ‘Gricean’ approach to describing the psychological states that support at least some kinds of (voluntary) animal communication (Gómez 1994; Brinck 2004; Moore 2017a). These approaches take their name from the philosopher Paul Grice, whose work attempted to specify necessary and sufficient conditions for an agent to act with communicative intent (in his words, actions possessed of non-natural meaning, or ‘meaningNN’). While Grice’s work has been highly influential in the study of human communication, it has often been considered ill-suited to the characterisation of the communication of animals, because the mental states Grice identified as characteristic of communication are thought to implicate psychological states that cannot plausibly be attributed to non-human minds. In Grice’s own words, communicative intentions are “plainly too sophisticated a state to be found in a language-destitute creature” (1986: 85).

The authors who argue that animals may be Gricean communicators accept Grice’s characterisation of communicative intentions, but reject his conclusion that communicative intentions cannot be attributed to animals (Gómez 1994; Moore 2016). This is because they deny that Grice’s characterisation of the cognitive prerequisites of meaningNN are entailed by his analysis of the intentional character of communication. This idea is controversial.

On Grice’s account, what distinguishes actions possessed of meaningNN from other kinds of actions is the intentions with which they are performed. Variations of his analysis of his account have been widely, if not universally, accepted (see Neale 1992; Sperber & Wilson 1995; Tomasello 2008; Scott-Phillips 2015). The following characterisation is derived from Neale’s (1992) modification of Grice’s (1957) account.

A speaker S acts with communicative intent if and only if she performs an utterance (x) for an interlocutor H intending:

(1)
H to produce a particular response r, and
(2)
H to recognise that S intends (1),

and additionally

(3)
S has no further intention that H be deceived about (1) and (2).

Together clauses (1), (2) and (3) are necessary and sufficient for acting with communicative intent. On this formulation, (1) specifies the goal that a communicator, S, aims to achieve through her utterance of x. Usually this is specified as either (i) an intention to produce a belief in H, or (ii) to have them perform some action α (although there may be other options [Moore 2017a]). For example, if I leave my empty wine glass on the table where you can see it, with the goal that you see and refill it, my intention (1) would be to have you refill my glass. While the first clause intention is necessary for an action to be communicative, Grice argued that it is not sufficient. That’s because many intuitively non-communicative actions can also be performed with intentions like (1). For example, I might surreptitiously leave my empty glass in view in the hope that you’ll see it, but without drawing attention to this for fear of seeming rude. This is consistent with (1), but Grice argued that such cases are intuitively not communicative.

For Grice, what truly distinguishes communicative acts from many other types of intentional act is their overtness. Successful communication is a public act: we know when someone is communicating with us. This is not the case in the example of me discreetly moving my glass, since here my host might be entirely unaware of my surreptitious goal. The openness of communication is captured by the addition of (2). I might fulfil (2) not only by leaving my glass where you can see it, but by deliberately drawing your attention to my glass. Here I not only have an intention like (1), but I also intend that my interlocutor recognise that I have this intention. The addition of clause (2) rules out cases where I try to have you refill my glass surreptitiously, and thereby captures the openness of communication.

Clause (3) blocks certain cases (Neale 1992) that many commentators have thought constitute counterexamples to Grice’s analysis. Typically they turn on cases where a speaker has a higher order intention that undermines their possession of (1) and (2), and so threatens the sufficiency of (1) and (2) for an account of communicative intentions. While many have thought this justifies the insertion of a blocking clause like (3), it need not be entertained by speakers (or hearers) to do its work, and so doesn’t add any complexity to the psychological states involved in Gricean communication.

4.2.1 Rehabilitating the Gricean account

A myriad of objections have been raised to the possibility that non-humans could be Gricean communicators. The most common concern is that Gricean communication is socio-cognitively demanding, because Gricean communication requires higher order metarepresentations of others’ mental states. For example, in the case of an utterance that is produced to change others’ beliefs, Grice’s analysis seems to require entertaining a fourth order metarepresentation like (i) S intends that (ii) H believe that (iii) S intends that (iv) H believe that p (Dennett 1983; see also Planer 2017; Scott-Phillips 2015; Sperber 2000; Sterelny 2017; Thompson 2014; and Gómez 1994; Brinck 2004; and Moore 2017a, for criticism of this view). Given that even twelve-year-old children struggle to understand fourth order meta-representations (Liddle & Nettle 2006), and since there is evidence of first order belief understanding in only a few animal species (Krupenye et al. 2016), these requirements seem to preclude the possibility of Gricean communicators in the animal kingdom.

Further concerns have also been raised, including that Gricean communication requires syntactically complex propositional thought (Bar-On 2013); that Gricean communication requires uniquely human forms of joint action (Tomasello 2008; Jankovic 2014; see Moore 2018a; see also §5.2); and that it requires a motivation to share information about mental states that seems to be missing from the animal kingdom (Bar-On 2013; Tomasello 2008; Scott-Phillips 2015; Scott-Phillips & Heintz 2023; see Moore 2017c for discussion; see also §5).

Proponents of the view that animals can be Gricean communicators argue for the claim not by attributing rich metarepresentational and cooperative abilities to animals, but by arguing against the assumption that Gricean communication is socio-cognitively difficult. For example, several proponents of the Gricean view have argued that Grice’s clause (2) can be fulfilled by the role of eye contact in communicative interaction, and that consequently subjects need not be capable of higher order metarepresentations to be able to act and interpret Gricean intent. They argue that if communicators engage their interlocutors in mutual eye contact as a means of addressing their communicative acts to them, as great ape species do (Gómez 1996), then their first clause intentions (1) will be public in a manner sufficient for the fulfilment of (2) (Moore 2017a; see also Gómez 1994; Brinck 2004). Moore (2017b) additionally argues that clauses (1) and (2) specify functional features of communicative acts, and their psychological correlates. For example, it’s because utterances are ordinarily causally inefficacious that they must be directed to the attention of their intended interlocutors, in the manner described by (2), so that interlocutors are encouraged to make inferences about the contents of agents’ communicative goals. As a result, he thinks, Gricean forms of communication may be present in many animal species, even if such creatures can produce and interpret only a very limited repertoire of Gricean acts.

Additional attenuations of the complexity of Gricean communication can also be made. For example, it has been argued there may be Gricean communicators whose communication consists only of imperative-like utterances, produced to solicit others to act (Moore 2017b; although see Scott-Phillips & Heintz 2023 for a contrary view); who engage in only limited forms of collaborative action, if any (Moore 2018a); whose utterances are not even propositionally structured (Moore 2021); and that there may be signature limits on the interpretational abilities of great ape communicators, despite their being Gricean communicators (Graham, Rossano & Moore 2024). On this development of the ‘minimally’ Gricean view, what is essential is only that communicative acts are produced with intentions characterised by clauses (1), (2) and (3), as described above, and that interpreters are capable of interpreting such intentions.

4.2.2 Objections to the ‘minimally’ Gricean View

Many object to even ‘minimally’ Gricean approaches to explaining animal communication.

Planer & Sterelny (2021) have argued that since folk psychology is a human construct, and not likely to be reflective of cognitive processes that support human communication, then we ought not to suppose that folk psychological theories of communication play any interesting role in explaining our communication. A similar point has been made by Dennett (2017; see also Azzouni 2013; Planer forthcoming), who argues that while Grice’s characterisation of communication is broadly right, we ought not to think of the states Grice described as needing to be represented by communicators. (As an analogy, consider that someone could catch a falling tennis ball without being able to represent the mathematical description of its trajectory.) The latter objection has something in common with Gricean approaches to animal communication, in that both views argue that common interpretations of Gricean psychology have been intellectualised. If Grice’s intentions need no longer be represented by subjects, or need not be represented in the ways often thought, then it’s no longer clear why the cognition of communicative intentions would be prohibitively difficult. (If agents need not represent the elements of Gricean intentions, then it becomes less clear why anyone would consider them too cognitively difficult for animals to understand. But perhaps humans alone have undergone the processes of natural selection that would enable us to track the features of Gricean intentions (Sperber & Wilson 2002; Azzouni 2013, especially p.348).)

Perhaps the most common objection to applications of a Gricean framework to animal communication is that the de-intellectualised reading of Grice is no longer recognisably Gricean. In response, Moore argues that his account satisfies clauses (1)–(3), discussed above, and that this is all that being a Gricean communicator requires (Moore 2017b). While recognising that animals are limited in comparison to humans in the complexity of the communicative intentions they can entertain and interpret, this does not necessitate giving up the Gricean framework for studying animal interactions. Instead, we can use the Gricean approach to develop a coherent, continuous theoretical framework within which to make sense of continuities between human and animal communication, while also allowing us to track points of difference. These include differences in the syntactic complexity of human and animal communication, and the additional resources that more sophisticated (e.g., human) agents can bring to pragmatic interpretation—including, for example, their ability to reflect on higher order mental states to help them disambiguate the contents of others’ utterances.

4.3 Intermediary pragmatics

Among those who accept that Gricean accounts of communication are cognitively demanding in ways that makes them unsuitable for application to animal communication, some have developed alternative theoretical accounts of intentional communication that can be used to characterise the interactions of non-humans. In different ways, such approaches have been developed by Millikan (1984, see also 2017), Green (2007), Bar-On (2013, 2021, forthcoming), Planer (2017), and Sterelny (2017), among philosophers, and Warren & Call (2022) and Scott-Phillips & Heintz (2023) among cognitive scientists. Common themes in their work include the idea that animal communication can be voluntary, goal-directed, and that hearers may sometimes make inferences about speakers’ goals—but where this can be achieved without Gricean demands on metarepresentation and Theory of Mind. Some of these authors have focused specifically on the development of accounts of pragmatic interpretation that are motivated by the rejection of both Gricean and Carnapian approaches. Bar-on (forthcoming) has called such accounts ‘intermediary pragmatics’.

Despite thinking that Gricean approaches are too cognitively demanding to support an account of the communicative interactions of languageless creatures (Bar-On 2013: 345), Bar-On thinks Grice was right that an account of pragmatic inference in animals must be “psychologically mediated” in the manner of human communication, at least if it is to play a role in explaining language evolution. Her intermediary pragmatics covers a class of behaviours that can be voluntarily produced and are psychologically mediated, and whose interpretation depends upon understanding speakers’ intentions, yet where the relevant intentions are not characterised in Gricean terms (Bar-On forthcoming),

Bar-On’s account is intended to accommodate communicative interactions between minded agents who lack a theoretical knowledge of mental states but who can nonetheless engage in processes of mutual interpretation. Often these types of interactions are made possible by the presence of expressive behaviours which show agents’ psychological states, including facial expressions and bodily postures, and that make subjects’ mental states perceptually available to observers. (see Bar-On 2013). They are said to be ‘Janus-faced’, insofar as they reveal both the states of the world to which a signaller is attending, and the signaller’s attitude or response towards those states. For example, a chimpanzee who leaps away from a Gaboon viper can be understood by an observer as being both directed towards and fearful of that snake. Although expressive behaviours are not always under intentional control, some can be brought under voluntary control. Moreover, they may be present when agents produce voluntary signals, in a manner that facilitates interpretation of them. In Bar-On’s words, this gives expressive signals

a proto-pragmatic life of their own qua communicative acts that are not underwritten by Gricean intentions. (Bar-On 2013: 368)

Bar-On emphasises that whether signal interpretation involves intermediary pragmatic interpretation is independent of how signals were learned. What’s key is that the communicative use of a signal relies on a receiver’s capacity to integrate contextual information, including arguably an uptake of the caller’s psychological state, as this is shown by their expressive behaviours. This can also occur even when signals are unlearned and produced inflexibly.

Another account of animal communication that falls under the banner of ‘intermediate pragmatics’ is Armstrong’s theory of representational coordination (Armstrong 2023), which he uses to model the ‘minded’ communicative interactions of primates living in relatively complex social groups. Like Bar-On, he emphasises that these forms of animal communication can be psychologically mediated, without being Gricean.

On Armstrong’s account, ‘minded communication’ is characterised in terms of its being flexibly (i.e., voluntarily) produced, generating responses that are also under the voluntary control of receivers, and as involving signals that are produced in order to coordinate the representational mental states of agents. Senders and receivers act flexibly based on their representations of their environment, and their expectations about the outcomes of their actions, including the perceived costs and benefits of their actions. Armstrong identifies the (biologically inherited) alarm calls of vervet monkeys as a plausible instance of minded communication. These calls succeed when senders and receivers both entertain representations of the same features of the world—like the presence of predator.

4.4 Concluding remarks on pragmatics

An outstanding theoretical debate for accounts of animal pragmatics concerns the extent to which existing views are inconsistent. There is good reason to think they are not. For example, proponents of Gricean and intermediate views accept that some calls are not under intentional control, and that the interpretation of these calls can be modelled by Carnapian approaches. Their objection, is rather, that these approaches are not suitable for characterising stages in the relatively recent evolution of language. Similarly, proponents of Gricean and intermediary pragmatics agree on many features of animal communication. It may be that their disagreement is partly terminological, concerning what is worthy of the name ‘Gricean’. This isn’t the only point of difference, though. For example, Moore places more emphasis than Bar-On on the ways in which utterances are addressed to others, and the psychology of this address (see §4.2). This may make their views compatible, but suited for describing slightly different cases—depending on whether communicative acts were deliberately addressed to their intended recipients. This would, potentially, make the transition to Gricean communication in phylogeny a case of the address of voluntary expressive acts, like those characterised by Bar-On (2013), being gradually brought under psychological control.

One point on which all would agree is that we currently don’t know enough about animal abilities for pragmatic interpretation, in any species, either with respect to the contextual interpretation of involuntarily produced signals, or the intention-dependent interpretation of voluntary signs. Some suggestive cases have been published, including studies of pointing comprehension in numerous species (Tomasello, Call, & Gluckman 1997; Hare & Tomasello 2005; Nawroth, Martin, & McElligott 2020). Nonetheless, more empirical research on contextual variation in the interpretation of both voluntarily and non-voluntarily produced signs would provide philosophers with welcome opportunities to theorise about the nature and limitations of these abilities.

5. Cooperation in Animal Communication

A final issue to consider concerns the extent to which animal communication is cooperative. The cooperative foundations of human communication have been thought key to explaining the evolution of language (Tomasello 2008), and some hold that only for humans do we have good evidence of voluntary, cooperative communication—performed for the purposes of sharing information, like the location of food. For example, Tomasello writes:

Communicating information helpfully … is extremely rare in the animal kingdom, even in our closest primate relatives[.] (Tomasello 2008: 5)

Scepticism regarding animal cooperative communication may be motivated by the idea that prosocial behaviour is biologically maladaptive. Prosocial behaviour—that is, behaviour in which one individual pays a cost to benefit another—has long been thought to be potentially difficult to explain within the framework of Darwinian natural selection (Hamilton 1964; Axelrod & Hamilton 1981; Axelrod 1984). If sharing information facilitates another’s survival, and natural selection is a matter of survival of the fittest, then an individual who shares information to benefit another may undermine its own survival prospects. There are several problems with this claim, though. First, what is meant by cooperative activity must be explained. Secondly, we ought not overstate the degree of empirical support for claims about the ‘selfish’ nature of animal communication.

5.1 Signalling theory

A minimal notion of cooperation is at work in signalling theory, a highly influential approach to communication inspired by David Lewis’ work Convention (1969). Versions of this view are defended by Millikan (1984, 2017), Green (2007), Skyrms (2010), Planer & Sterelny (2021), and Planer & Godfrey-Smith (2021), among others. Signalling theory frames the communication of biological species using the tools of evolutionary theory (Skyrms 2010). It views communication as a dynamic process of coadaptation between a sender and a receiver, where senders and receivers mutually shape their behaviours over time.

Often presented as an alternative to Gricean approaches (e.g., Planer & Sterelny 2021), signalling theory makes only modest demands on agent psychology, and makes no references to speakers’ intentions. This makes it suitable for characterising the communication of many biological species, including cells and bacteria, whose interactions are unlikely to be well characterised by intentionalist theories of communication. It is sometimes also adopted by authors who are sceptical that folk psychological explanations of behaviour map neatly onto a mechanistic account of the mind (ibid.). While often used to frame accounts of biologically coevolved pairs of signals and responses (Tinbergen 1952, Maynard-Smith & Harper 2003), its application is also not restricted to such cases. Signals may also be designed by processes of cultural evolution (Millikan 1984), copied (Planer & Godfrey-Smith 2021), or even improvised (Planer & Sterelny 2021), so long as there is some process by which they are designed and selected. However, to the extent that signalling theory dispenses with reference to speakers’ intentions, it may be unsuitable for characterising signals the interpretation of which is intention-dependent.

In the classic set-up devised by Skyrms (2010), senders and receivers are viewed as asymmetrical agents. The sender can perceive the world, but is only able to act in ways visible to the receiver. The receiver can act but cannot perceive the world. In this scenario selective pressures can lead to the emergence and stabilisation of signalling systems. Signallers can evolve to produce signs in response to perceived states of affairs, transmitting information to receivers; and receivers can evolve to respond to signals, since it is adaptive for them to learn about states of the world they cannot perceive. The essence of communication, according to signalling theory, lies in coordination between the receiver’s actions and states of the world (act-state coordination), including the sender’s actions (act-act coordination) (Planer & Godfrey-Smith 2021). This coordination is exemplified by the receiver attending and responding to what the sender perceives, such as the presence of a predator or a source of food, or what the perceiver is doing. For example, based on this framework, play signals can be seen as enabling coordination between senders and receivers during play (Bekoff 1975); and aggressive displays as enabling their recipients to coordinate with senders’ aggressive states of mind (Hinde 1981).

One key issue in signalling theory concerns the stability of honest signalling (Maynard-Smith & Harper 2003; Searcy & Nowicky 2005). In cases where senders can benefit by deceiving receivers, the signalling system is at risk of collapse—because receivers who are too often deceived will stop responding to signals. Many cases of deception have been documented in animal communication. For example, Photuris fireflies mimic the flashing mating signals of female Photinus fireflies to prey on the males (Lewis & Cratsley 2008).

A number of explanations have been offered to explain the stability of signalling systems. Some scholars have underlined common, cooperative interest as a stabilising factor in the emergence and maintenance of signalling systems within and between species (Planer & Godfrey-Smith 2021; Millikan 2004, 2017). When it is in the interests of both senders and receivers that receivers appropriately respond to the states of affairs signalled by the signals, there is little incentive for signallers to deceive, and signals stabilise. However, there may also be circumstances when signalling systems can stabilise even where agents’ interests do not overlap (Planer & Godfrey-Smith 2021). Planer & Sterelny (2021) also argue that communicating in small groups reduces the problem of dishonest signalling, because where there are multiple senders, and so multiple sources of information, attempts at deceiving become more risky, because they are more likely to be discovered.

Other authors have emphasised the adaptive value of signals that are hard to fake (Green 2007, 2009). These are relatively common in the animal kingdom. ‘Indices’ are signals that are difficult to fake because they are connected to agents’ physical characteristics. For example, tigers leave scratch marks on trees corresponding to their body size. The higher the marks on a tree, the larger a tiger must be to have left them—providing nearby competitors with reliable estimates of the animal’s size. ‘Handicaps’ are signals that are hard to fake because they are costly for the signaller. For example, the tail of a peacock is large and heavy, hindering the peacock’s mobility and potentially diminishing their chance of survival. Carrying a big tail is a reliable indicator of health, because only strong peacocks can bear the energetic cost.

One recent application of signalling theory is what Green calls ‘organic meaning’, by which he aims to bring together all instances of meaning in communication (Green 2019). On Green’s account, organic meaning is the transfer of information between a sender and a receiver that is the product of design. Natural design, learning mechanisms, and intentional design are all possible ways in which the signal can provide receivers with information: the notion of design encompasses, in Green’s account, evolutionary, cultural evolutionary, and intentional tools. In this respect Green’s approach is similar to Millikan’s account of intentional signs (1984, 2017). When a signal is specifically designed to convey information about an agent’s psychological states (including emotions, intentions, beliefs and desires), it is considered, by Green, a case of expression (Green 2007).

Providing receivers with information gives a broad-brush explanation of why communicative acts are performed. Green’s account of organic meaning can therefore be seen as providing a unified theoretical framework for the study of communication, since it can be applied to many communicative interactions in both animals and humans. An eagle alarm call is, like the utterance of a sentence like “There’s an eagle”, produced to provide receivers with information about eagles; and there is a sense in which both kinds of signal were designed for this end. At the same time, Green’s framework is very general: his notion of design is neutral about the biological, cultural, and psychological processes underlying signal production. Thus, for all that Green’s theory can help us to understand the properties that many communicative acts have in common, it has little to say about other features of communicative behaviour that are important for understanding the nature and evolution of communication in animals and humans, and which are not included in this account (Palazzolo forthcoming).

5.2 Communication as a form of joint action

While there is a weak, non-psychological notion of cooperation at work in signalling theory, it is not the kind of cooperation thought central to human communication by some cognitive scientists, and characterised by Tomasello as “human cooperative communication” (Tomasello 2008). (While Tomasello takes his view to be the same as Gricean communication, we don’t assume that here.)

Tomasello’s claim that communicating “helpfully … is extremely rare in the animal kingdom” (Tomasello 2008: 5) incorporates two independent notions of cooperation. The first concerns the motivations with which agents communicate. Tomasello distinguishes between communicating to share information and communicating to make requests or give orders. The former function, which includes utterances like “There are strawberries by the river”, can be produced for reasons that are intended to benefit the intended recipient, without necessarily benefiting the signaller (i.e., helpfully). It is paradigmatically (although not always) performed using assertion-like speech acts. Helpful utterances are contrasted with utterances produced to benefit the sender, like “Give me that food!”. These are paradigmatically (although not always) performed using directive speech acts.

The second sense of cooperation to which Tomasello appeals characterises human communication as a form of ‘shared intentionality’ (Bratman 1999: part 2; Jankovic 2014). This term describes the action characteristic of agents who voluntarily engage in collaborative activity. Shared intentionality is often thought to be psychologically demanding in respects comparable to Gricean communication (Butterfill 2012; Blomberg 2015).

Tomasello uses the term ‘human cooperative communication’ to describe a Gricean (or ‘ostensive-inferential’ [Sperber & Wilson 1995]) psychological framework for communication that, he thinks, is made possible only by the co-presence of communication that is both helpful, and a form of joint action (see Moore 2018a for discussion). He holds that communication is a form of shared intentionality because, at least in human communication, Gricean forms of pragmatic interpretation are pervasive (Sperber & Wilson 1995). Since a speaker’s message must be inferred from what they say, a signaller must craft a message to communicate their goal, and their interlocutor must spend time and effort attending to and interpreting the signaller’s message. Tomasello also proposes a connection between helpful, informative communication and the kinds of Gricean pragmatic interpretation that he thinks essential for explaining language evolution. He argues that Gricean communication arose in evolutionary history only when speakers and hearers became willing to invest time and effort interpreting one another’s utterances, and that they did this only when they expected their interlocutors to provide them with helpful information (Tomasello 2008). As a result, Tomasello thinks the psychological framework that is characteristic of Gricean communication evolved in phylogeny only when agents started to communicate to help others. Since chimpanzees communicate largely to make requests, and not to share information, Tomasello argues they cannot be Gricean communicators. This requires motivational (not to mention cognitive) states not present in the animal kingdom. This argument purports to explain why chimpanzees are poor at understanding informative pointing (Tomasello 2006, 2008; Herrmann & Tomasello 2006). Tomasello and colleagues argue that chimpanzees are fundamentally competitive, not cooperative (Hare & Tomasello 2004). Meanwhile domestic dogs, who have been bred to help humans, fare much better at understanding helpful points (Hare & Tomasello 2005).

A number of issues could be raised with this view. First, as Section 4.2 makes clear, Grice’s analysis of meaningNN was specified to incorporate imperative utterances. So Tomasello may be wrong to think that only unselfish communicators can be Gricean communicators (Moore 2017c). Furthermore, it may be that while some forms of communication (e.g., conversation) require ‘shared intentionality’, not all do. If Gricean communicative acts are not always difficult to interpret then, where the interpretational demands are reduced, it may be possible for interlocutors to grasp one another’s messages without effortful interpretation. In such circumstances, the collaborative demands on communication would decrease (ibid.). Nonetheless, Tomasello may be right that historical increases in the motivation to attend to and engage with an interlocutor were driven by agents’ expecting to benefit from communicated information. In turn, this may have driven improvements in pragmatic interpretation, and language evolution, even if these factors are independent of whether agents are Gricean communicators. On such a story, one would expect to find more impressive feats of pragmatic interpretation in attentive species, like domestic dogs, who do understand informative pointing (Hare & Tomasello 2005), and perhaps even individual differences between members of the same species that correlate with social attention (Benítez-Burraco, Ferretti, & Progovac 2021; Berio & Moore 2023). This would be a valuable avenue for future research.

Nonetheless, Tomasello’s second claim—that cooperative communication is uniquely human—is built on a very limited sample of animal communication. In part, this is because relatively little is known about the intentional communication and interpretation of signals by many species. Even for well understood species, like dogs and chimpanzees, there is a great deal to learn. For example, since Tomasello’s 2008 book, compelling evidence of voluntary, helpful communication has been found in chimpanzees, with the discovery that they call to warn ignorant others of the presence of sleeping snakes (Crockford, Wittig, & Zuberbühler 2017; Moore 2019). For other species, even highly intelligent ones like dolphins, we know almost nothing about their natural communication. As we learn more about the animal kingdom, we may gather more evidence of voluntary, pro-social communication.

Existing theoretical frameworks for interpreting animal communication may also underestimate the extent to which it is produced with helpful, informative goals. For example, Tomasello’s claim about the rarity of helpful communication concerns only voluntary signals. He is not seeking to characterise evolutionarily conserved alarm calls that may not be fully under voluntary control, like the alarm calls of vervet monkeys (Wheeler & Fischer 2012; but see Cheney & Seyfarth 2018). As such, the question of whether these calls are cooperative (in the way he thinks rare) does not arise. If it were subsequently discovered that such calls are produced under voluntary control, the question of whether they are helpful would reappear. In recent years, we have learned that chimpanzee vocalisations are the subject of much more voluntary control than was recently thought to be the case. As we learn more about the ecology of wild animals, and better understand the function of their calls, claims about the motivations underlying calls may therefore be reevaluated.

6. Concluding Remarks

While philosophical work on animal communication is theoretically disunified, common themes recur in the literature, including questions about voluntary production, the psychological correlates of signalling behaviours and their interpretation, concerns about whether or not animal communication is cooperative, and the extent to which it might be syntactically complex. Additionally, different approaches may not always be incompatible, so much as complementary lenses for characterising different communicative phenomena across the animal kingdom.

At the same time, for all that accounts may be complementary, disagreements about the interpretation of data do arise. Different explanatory accounts reflect not only the different kinds of communication in the animal kingdom, but also competing philosophical commitments. In their interpretations of animal behaviour, some scholars emphasise richer, more human-like interpretations (‘booster’ views—e.g., Gricean vs. non-Gricean accounts of animal communication: compare Moore 2017a with Scott-Phillips & Heintz 2023), while others advocate for leaner, deflationary interpretations (‘scoffer’ views—e.g., Chomskian accounts of animal semantics). Disagreements may reflect a more general set of considerations about whether human and animal minds should be characterised in terms that are continuous, or discontinuous; and attitudes towards continuity-based explanations may in turn reflect different valuations of the explanatory principles that we should bring to bear on the interpretation of animals minds.

Competing parsimony principles encourage contrasting explanations of communicatively relevant behaviours in humans and animals. For example, eye contact is sometimes interpreted as important for, and so evidence of, Gricean communication in humans (Gómez 1994; Moore 2016). Whereas accounts motivated by cladistic parsimony (Sober 2005) interpret eye contact in great apes as evidence of similar communicative mechanisms in non-humans, those sympathetic to Morgan’s canon (Morgan 1894; see Andrews & Monsó 2021 for discussion) may prefer a deflationary interpretation of the same behaviour (Tomasello 2008; Scott-Phillips 2015). Nonetheless, the existence of fundamentally different approaches to the explanation of behaviour remains a feature of animal communication research. As new data on animal communicative abilities are collected, they will further constrain the empirically tenable claims that can be made. Much current research has taken primates as model species, and there may be much more to learn from different species, including cetaceans and eusocial insects. With the advent of new AI-driven technologies for interpreting animal communication, moreover, we may be on the cusp of thrilling new discoveries (Rutz et al. 2023). Nonetheless, the need for data to be interpreted, and the existence of competing explanations of the same behaviours, will ensure that philosophers have an important contribution to make to the characterisation of non-human communication.

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