Past Contributing Subject Editors

The SEP administrative staff, on behalf of all of the SEP contributors and readers, would like to thank the following members of the profession, who have volunteered their time and energy serving as subject editors on the SEP Editorial Board. They have helped us to determine which topics should be included in their section, which members of the profession to invite, read entry proposals and approved volunteers, and vetted SEP entries (sometimes multiple drafts). We are very much in their debt.

Stephen Davies, served Fall 2002–Spring 2023.
Stephen's breadth and depth in aesthetics leave us in his debt for his advice on how to improve the SEP section on this topic. He helped fill the gap when Ted Cohen (the original SEP editor for Aesthetics) passed away. He personally edited, or co-edited, entries including Aesthetics and the Philosophy of Art, Beardsley’s Aesthetics, Depiction, Existentialist Aesthetics, History of Western Philosophy of Music: Antiquity to 1800, History of Western Philosophy of Music: since 1800, Philosophy of Architecture, Philosophy of Humor, The Concept of the Aesthetic, The Definition of Art, The Philosophy of Dance, and The Philosophy of Music.
Sherri Irvin, served Spring 2013–Spring 2023.
Sherri provided valuable input for 10 years, editing or co-editing entries on Aesthetics of the Everyday, Art and Ethical Value, Artifact, Conceptual Art, Dewey’s Aesthetics, Environmental Aesthetics, Erotic Art, Feminist Aesthetics, History of the Ontology of Art, History of Western Philosophy of Music: Antiquity to 1800, History of Western Philosophy of Music: since 1800, Imaginative Resistance, Paradox of Tragedy, Philosophy of Sport, and The Philosophy of Digital Art. We're extremely grateful for her service to the profession and for helping to ensure the SEP's entries on Aesthetics are authoritative.
Jacqueline (Jackie) Scott, served Winter 2007–Fall 2022.
Jackie joined the board at a point when it was growing significantly. We are grateful for her 15 years on the board during which time she was involved with many entries, including African Ethics, African Sage Philosophy, Africana Philosophy, Akan Philosphy of the Person, Alain LeRoy Locke, Alexander Crummell, Anna Julia Cooper, Black Reparations, Double Consciousness, Frederick Douglass, Frantz Fanon, Josiah Royce, Négritude, and Race. She also provided valuable advice for other prospective entries. We will miss her input.
Penelope Mackie (b. 1953, d. 2022), served Winter 1999–Fall 2022
Penelope joined the SEP Editorial Board when we first created to multi-person team of subject editors in Metaphysics, back in 1999. We benefited from her advice for 23 years and we were sad to learn of her passing. During her time on the board, she worked on many entries, including Actualism, Conceptualism, Dispositions, Fatalism, Identity, Identity Theory of Truth, Intrinsic vs. Extrinsic Value, Natural Kinds, Nothingness, Personal Identity, Possible Worlds, Pragmatism, Relative Identity, Singular Propositions, States of Affairs, Substance, and Temporal Parts. We will greatly miss her insightful comments and careful attention to detail.
John Cooper (b. 1939, d. 2022), served Winter 1997–Summer 2022
John was the founding editor for our general section on Ancient Philosophy. He was the sole editor of that section (not including our separate sections on Plato and Aristotle) through Fall 2014 and single-handedly edited over 60 entries. He was always quick with comments and took a deep interest in the details of content as well as writing style. We are ever grateful for his work on the SEP and saddened by his passing.
Miriam Solomon, served Winter 2011–Summer 2022
Miriam was an actively engaged and tireless subject editor for Philosophy of Science. Over the decade that she worked on the SEP, she was involved in dozens of entries and proposals including Abduction, Analogy and Analogical Reasoning, Historicist Theories of Scientific Rationality, Ludwik Fleck, Paul Feyerabend, Realism and Theory Change in Science, Philosophy of Medicine, Reproducibility of Scientific Results, Scientific Discovery, Scientific Pluralism, Scientific Realism, Social Dimensions of Scientific Knowledge, Underdetermination of Scientific Theory, and many others. We're grateful for all of her work and we'll miss her input.
Jason Stanley, served Fall 2002–Summer 2022
Jason was one of our early editors for Philosophy of Language. His advice was invaluable for helping to get the section set up, suggesting and prioritizing entries. Over the course of his twenty years on the board, he worked on a variety of entries including Anaphora, Compositionality, Counterfactuals, Descriptions, Generic Generalizations, Indicative Conditionals, Intensional Transitive Verbs, Metaphor, Names, Propositional Attitude Reports, Sorites Paradox, Speech Acts, Rigid Designators, Truth, and Vagueness. We are grateful for all his efforts and advice.
Phillip Bricker, served Spring 2004–Spring 2022
Phil is one of the few subject editors to serve in two areas. He started as an editor for 20th Century Philosophy in 2004. Then, in 2011, he switched to the Metaphysics section. Over the years, he worked on many entries including: Chisholm, David Lewis’s Metaphysics, Existence, Gödel, Intrinsic vs Extrinsic Properties, Leśniewski, Logical Constructions, Metaphysics of Causation, Monism, Possible Worlds, Propositions, Quine, Reichenbach, Russell’s Logical Atomism, The Problem of the Many, Time, Weyl, and Wittgenstein. We will miss having the benefit of his clear and careful editorial insight and advice.
Gül Russell, served Fall 2003–Winter 2021
Gü was among the initial group of editors for Arabic and Islamic Philosophy on the SEP Editoral Board, specializing in Arabic and Islamic philosophy of science and medicine. She helped to shape the list of topics we currently cover, and refereed entries on Ikhwân al-Safâ, Greek Sources in Arabic and Islamic Philosophy, Ibn Kammuna, Umar Khayyam, Al-Farabi's Psychology and Epistemology, and Ibn Sina's Natural Philosophy. We will miss the expertise and advice that she brought to the subject area.
Vincent Hendricks, served Summer 2004–Fall 2021
Vincent was an active subject editor for Philosophical Logic and made a number of fruitful suggestions about organizing this subject. The project benefitted greatly from his insightful editorial work. He had oversight (sometimes sharing responsibility) for the entries Axiomatic Theories of Truth, Connexive Logic, Defeasible Reasoning, Dynamic Epistemic Logic, Epistemic Logic, Fuzzy Logic, Intensional Logic, Logic of Action, Logic of Conditionals, Modal Logic, Philosophical Aspects of Multi-modal Logic, and Self-reference. We're grateful for his contributions.
Cécile Fabre, served Summer 2016–Fall 2021
Cécile played a significant role on the editorial team for Social and Political Philosophy during her 5 years on the board. She worked on the following entries: Alienation, Children’s Rights, Conservatism, Dirty Hands, Markets, Oakeshott, Pacifism, Patriotism, Philosophy of History, Philosophy of Money and Finance, Privacy, Revolution, Terrorism, and Torture. She also provided editorial advice on many entry proposals. We’re grateful for her work and will miss her input.
Michael Rea, served Summer 2016–Fall 2021
Michael was actively engaged as a co-editor for Philosophy of Religion and helped referee a number of different entries and updated. He played a significant role in overseeing the entries on Sin in Christian Thought, Eternity, Philosophy and Christian Theology, Concepts of God, Divine Providence, Panenetheism, Atonement, Feminist Philosophy of Religion, Prophecy, Divine Simplicity, Omnipresence, Divine Revelation, Trinity, Charles Hartshorne, and Heaven and Hell. We’ll miss his wisdom and advice.
Jorge Gracia (b. 1942, d. 2021), served Summer 2006–Summer 2021
Jorge was one of the founding co-editors of the SEP subject area of Latin American and Iberian Philosophy, which now has 14 entries. He helped review the entries on in Latin America Philosophy: Metaphilosophical Foundations, Philosophy in Chile, Latinx Philosophy, Skepticism in Latin America, and Philosophy of Science in Latin America. We were sad to hear the news of his death and will miss having his input and advice for the future development of this section.
Thomas Flynn, served Summer 2001–Spring 2020
We’re extremely grateful to Tom for the work he put into the SEP, to help us build up our offerings on (primarily French) philosophy of the 20th century. He commissioned and refereed entries on Althusser, Baudrillard, Bergson, Deleuze, Derrida, Existentialism, Lacan, Levinas, Lyotard, Marcel, Postmodernism, Ricoeur, and Weil. We wish him all the best of luck in retirement.
Meghan Sullivan, served Spring 2016–Spring 2020
Meghan worked on the following entries in the Philosophy of Religion: Afterlife, Fideism, Foreknowledge and Free Will, God and Other Necessary Beings, Heaven and Hell, Omniscience, Ontological Arguments, Petitionary Prayer, Philosophy and Christian Theology, and Religious Language. We’re grateful for the multi-faceted expertise that she brought to discussions about the section on philosophy of Religion.
Wil Waluchow, served Fall 2010–Fall 2019
Wil took over from Liam Murphy in Fall 2010 and helped steer the SEP’s Philosophy of Law section for the next 9 years. He either refereed or lent advice on the following entries: Causation in the Law, The Nature of Law, Intellectual Property, Economic Analysis of Law, Natural Law Theories, Legal Concept of Evidence, Legal Realism, Naturalism in Legal Philosophy, Property, Philosophy of Contracts, Legal Punishment, Theories of Criminal Law, Law and Ideology. We’re grateful for the time he spent advising us.
Ajume Wingo, served Summer 2009–Summer 2017
Ajume refereed or advised us on entries on African Ethics, Frederick Douglass, Negritude, African Sage Philosophy, and Double Conscisousness. We’re grateful for his efforts and will miss his input.
William Edmundson, served Fall 2011–Fall 2019
William not only reviewed numerous SEP entries but also offered lots of advice on many issues and proposals that came up in the Philosophy of Law section. The entries he refereed include: Theories of the Common Law of Contracts, Law and Ideology, Law and Language, Legal Rights, and Retributive Justice. We wish him all the best for his future academic projects.
Christopher (Kit) Wellman, served Winter 2012–Summer 2019
Kit refereed a wide range of entries in Social and Political Philosophy, including: Global Justice, Cosmopolitanism, Human Rights, Nozick’s Political Philosophy, Transitional Justice, Libertarianism, Republicanism, Global Democracy, Liberalism, Punishment, Discrimination, Sovereignty, Paternalism, Exploitation, and Public Reason. We’ll very much miss working with him.
Greg Restall, served Summer 1999–Spring 2019
Greg helped to establish the SEP’s section on the Philosophy of Logic, by refereeing entries on Defeasible Reasoning, Disjunction, Curry Paradox, Model Theory, Fitch Paradox, Logical Constants, Dialetheism, Skolem’s Paradox, Liar Paradox, Propositional Functions, Truth Values, and Impossible Worlds. We’re indebted to him for his comments and suggestions for improvements on these entries.
Agnieszka Jaworska, served Fall 2009–Spring 2019
Agnieszka refereed a number entries in Biomedical Ethics, including four different entries on Disability, and the entries Justice, Inequality, & Health, Principle of Beneficence in Applied Ethics, Parenthood & Procreation, Pregnancy, Birth & Medicine, Suicide, and Voluntary Euthanasia. Agnieszka also authored two entries: The Grounds of Moral Status and Advance Directives and Substitute Decision-Making. We’ve enjoyed working with her and are grateful for all the work she put into the project.
Richard Taylor, served Winter 2003–Winter 2018
Richard was among the initial group of editors for Arabic and Islamic Philosophy on the SEP Editoral Board. He refereed many entries including ones on Al-Kindi, Al-Farabi, Al-Ghazali, Ibn Arabi, Ibn Bâjja, Ibn Rushd, Ibn Sina, and Suhrawardi. We are grateful for his efforts and will miss his editorial input.
Barbara von Eckardt, served Winter 1997–Winter 2018
Barbara was the first editor for the Philosophy of Cognitive Science on the SEP Editorial Board. She served for over 20 years and for almost half that time she was the sole editor for the area. She helped shape and guide our coverage, reviewing numerous drafts and updates. We are grateful for her work.
Paul Griffiths, served Fall 2000–Summer 2018
Paul served on the SEP Editorial Board as a co-editor for Philosophy of Biology. He’s refereed a large number of entries including: Replication, Species, Sociobilogy, Evolutionary Psychology, Fitness, Darwinism, Life, Experiment in Biology, Biological Altruism, Conservation Biology, Innate and Acquired Characteristics, Evolution, Biological Information, Creationism, Morality and Evolutionary Biology, Adaptation, Molecular Biology, and Developmental Biology. We’ll miss his broad perspective on the field.
Gideon Rosen, served Fall 1999–Spring 2018
Gideon was a Metaphysics co-editor on the SEP Editorial Board for almost 19 years and, over that time, gave us valuable advice on a wide number of topics. He refereed many entries, including: Analysis, Animalism, Dispositions, Fiction, Fictional Entities, Fictionalism, Metaphysical Grounding, Metaphysics, Naturalism, Nominalism in Metaphysics, Nonexistent Objects, Platonism in Metaphysics, Properties, Relativism, Simplicity, Sortals, Value Theory, and Varieties of Modality. We could always count on him for quick, insightful replies to editorial matters and we will miss working with him.
Eileen O’Neill (b. 1953, d. 2017), served Fall 2009–Winter 2017
The SEP staff were disheartened to hear of Eileen’s untimely passing. She brought her breadth of historical knowledge to the SEP as our go-to advisor on the History of Feminism. She refereed entries on Simone de Beauvoir, Margaret Fell, François Poulain de la Barre, Madeleine de Scudéry, Lucrezia Marinella, Catharine Macaulay, and Elisabeth (Princess of Bohemia). It will be difficult to find someone to replace her.
Samuel Freeman served Winter 2000–Fall 2017
Samuel served nearly 17 years on the SEP Editorial Board, and we’ve been extremely grateful for his sage advice on a number of fundamental topics in Social and Political Philosophy. He refereed entries on Justice, Rights, Reflective Equilibrium, Kant’s Social and Political Philosophy, John Rawls, Friedrich Hayek, Public Reason, Retributive Justice, and advised us on numerous others, such as Voting and Markets. His shoes will be hard to fill.
Delia Graff Fara (b. 1970, d. 2017), served Spring 2013–Spring 2017
In the four years Delia served on the Board, she advised us on numerous complex editorial situations that arose in the SEP section on Philosophy of Language. She shepherded several entries to publication and gave guidance on numerous proposals. We are grateful for having had the benefit of her keen insights and clear assessments. Her input is missed. We were greatly saddened by the news of her untimely death.
Simone Chambers, served Fall 1999–Summer 2016
Simone played a significant role in the organization and development of the SEP section on Social and Political Philosophy, having joined the board shortly after the section was created. She advised us on and refereed over 30 SEP entries including: Citizenship, Civic Education, Communitarianism, Globalization, Identity Politics, Impartiality, Political Obligation, Political Representation, Progress, and Recognition. We are grateful for her efforts and will miss her input.
John Fischer, served Winter 1998–Summer 2016
John served on the Board for over 15 years, at first co-editing entries in the Philosophy of Action and then single-handedly editing this area. Entries he oversaw include: Abilities, Action, Agency, Arguments for Incompatibilism, Blame, Causal Determinism, Compatibilism, Free Will, Incompatibilist Theories of Free Will, Instrumental Rationality, Intention, Moral Responsibility,Personal Autonomy, Practical Reason, Practical Reason and the Structure of Actions, and Shared Agency. We are grateful for his efforts and will miss his input.
Thomas Pogge, served Spring 1999–Summer 2016
Thomas played a founding role in organizing the SEP section on Social and Political Philosophy (starting in early 1999). He helped select the other section co-editors, identified gaps in SEP coverage and found many new authors to write SEP entries. He regularly communicated directly with those authors and helped to ensure they got their work done. He personally refereed over 40 SEP entries. We are indebted to him for the many times he discovered material that had to be significantly revised before an entry became authoritative and publishable. We are grateful for his efforts.
Edward Wierenga, served Summer 2000–Spring 2016
Edward played a key role in the development of our coverage of Philosophy of Religion. During his 16 years on the Editorial Board, he reviewed and gave advice regarding just about every one of the 45 entries currently published as of May 2016. Some of these are (to name a few): Atheism and Agnotisticism, Concepts of God, Divine Providence, Epistemology of Religion, Faith, Hiddenness of God, Immutability, Miracles, Ontological Arguments, Pantheism, Philosophy and Christian Theology, The Problem of Evil, Religious Experience, and Trinity.
G. Aldo Antonelli (b. 1962, d. 2015), served Summer 2003–Fall 2015.
The SEP team was greatly saddened to learn of Aldo’s death at age 53. He was a co-editor for entries on Mathematical Logic for over 12 years and always provided us not only with advice about authors to commission but also with careful and constructive advice and referee reports on the entries he was assigned. The latter include the entries on Recursive Functions, Infinitary Logic, Computability and Complexity, Algebra, Turing Machines, The Notation in Principia Mathematica, Type Theory, Quine’s New Foundations, Model Theory, First-order Model Theory, Category theory, Alternative Axiomatic Set Theories, Boolean Algebra, The Axiom of Choice, The Epsilon Calculus, Nonwellfounded Set Theory, Combinatory Logic, The Lambda Calculus, and Classical Logic. Finally, we’d like to acknowledge Aldo’s contribution as an SEP author: he wrote the SEP’s entry on nonmonotonic logic, which was first published in December 2001. Aldo maintainined the piece until December 2014, when he brought on a coauthor to help update and maintain it.
Alvin Goldman, served Fall 2009–Summer 2015
Alvin provided lots of advice about the section on Epistemology and had oversight on a number of entries in that section. He provided advice on: Analysis of Knowledge, Coherentist Theories of Epistemic Justification, Epistemic Basing Relation, Epistemological Problems of Perception, Internalist vs Externalist Conceptions of Epistemic Justification, Knowledge How, Naturalism in Epistemology, Perceptual Experience and Perceptual Justification, and Skepticism. We’ll miss working with him.
Michael Forster, served Summer 2005–Winter 2014
Michael refereed numerous entries in the SEP, including August Wilhelm Rehberg, August Wilhelm von Schlegel, Bruno Bauer, Hermann von Helmholtz, Johann Gottlieb Fichte, Karl Leonhard Reinhold, Max Weber, Søren Kierkegaard, Wilhelm Dilthey, Georg Friedrich Philipp von Hardenberg [Novalis], Georg Wilhelm Friedrich Hegel, Friedrich Heinrich Jacobi, Friedrich Nietzsche, Friedrich Schlegel, Friedrich Daniel Ernst Schleiermacher, and Karl Marx. We’re sorry that we’ll no longer have the benefit of his advice on new entries and updates.
Lodi Nauta, served Spring 2011–Fall 2014
Lodi served as a subject editor for Renaissance and 16th Century Philosophy. The entries he worked on included Heinrich Cornelius Agrippa von Nettesheim, Giordano Bruno, Natural Philosophy in the Renaissance, Jacques Lefèvre d’Étaples, Thomas More, Francesco Patrizi of Cherso, Girolamo [Geronimo] Cardano, Pietro Pomponazzi, Lorenzo Valla, Michel de Montaigne, and Natural Philosophy in the Renaissance. We’ll miss his input.
Lisa Gannett, served Winter 2007–Fall 2014
Lisa advised us on, or refereed, numerous entries in the SEP, including Genetics, Biodiversity, Human Genome Project, Heredity, Gene, Epigenesis, Philosophy of Chemistry, The Genotype/Phenotype Distinction, Reductionism in Biology, Population Genetics, Biological Notion of the Self, and Evolutionary Genetics. We’ll miss her valuable input.
Josh Cohen, served Fall 2000–Summer 2014
Josh gave us terrific advice over the course of nearly 14 years and we’ll miss his input. He had a hand in advising us about (whether a topic merited an entry, which authors to invite) and refereeing numerous SEP entries. These include: Ancient Political Philosophy, Arendt, Civil Rights, Conservatism, Democracy, Philosophy of Economics, Egalitarianism, Exploitation, Globalization, Hayek, Philosophy of History, Intergenerational Justice, Justice and Bad Luck, Locke’s Political Philosophy, Privacy, Risk, Rawls, and Spencer.
Jason Robert, served Spring 2004–Spring 2014
During his 10 years of service, Jason refereed the following entry: Units and Levels of Selection, The Biological Notion of Individual, Sociobiology and Evolutionary Psychology, Evolution and Development, Molecular Biology, Ecology, Epigenesis and Preformationism, Feminist Philosophy of Biology, Reductionism in Biology, Heredity and Heritability, The Distinction Between Innate vs. Acquired Characteristics, Character/Trait, the Human Genome Project, Creationism, and Cultural Evolution. We’re very grateful for his efforts.
Ted Cohen, (b. 1939, d. 2014), served Fall 1998–Spring 2014
Ted joined the SEP’s Editorial Board as a subject editor in Aesthetics not long after we began adding subject editors in 1997. The past few years he served mostly in an advisory capacity. During the time of his tenure, he’s always been ready to advise us about topics and potential authors, and refereed all the entries that first came online in this subject area. We’re in his debt.
Nancy Tuana, served Spring 2001–Spring 2014
Nancy helped to shape the growth and development of the section on Feminist Philosophy. Together with Sally Haslanger and then Jenny Saul, Nancy oversaw the subject area—formulating the lineup of entries, finding authors, and then refereeing the draft entries. There are dozens of entries in the section on Feminist Philosophy, most of which have already had at least one update, and Nancy has had a hand in almost every one. She also provided her expertise in helping to get the new team of Feminist Philosophy editors started. The SEP is very much in her debt.
David Copp, served Spring 1999–Spring 2014
We are extremely grateful to David for initially organizing the SEP area of Metaethics during his first few years of service. Over the course of his tenure, he has sent us comments on the following entries: Moral Particularism, Moral Skepticism, Theological Voluntarism, Metaethics, Moral Epistemology, Moral Non-Naturalism, Moral Cognitivism vs. Non-Cognitivism, Morality and Practical Reason, Action on Agent-Neutral vs. Agent-Relative Reasons, Incommensurable Values, Constructivism in Metaethics, Reasons for Action: Internal vs External, Morality and Evolutionary Biology, Practical Reason and the Structure of Actions, Moral Realism, Reasons for Action: Agent-Neutral vs. Agent-Relative, and The Grounds of Moral Status, among others. It will be difficult to replace him.
David Brink, served Spring 2000–Summer 2013
We are indebted to David for reviewing or advising us about the following entries: Autonomy in Moral and Political Philosophy, Consequentialism, Desert, Egoism, Forgiveness, Identity and Ethics, Natural Law Tradition in Ethics, Life, Love and Friendship, Moral Character, Moral Luck, Moral Reasoning, Paternalism, Personal, Personal Identity and Ethics, Political Philosophy, Promises, Special Obligations, Supererogation, The Grounds of Moral Status, and The Meaning of Life. We’ll miss his interesting ideas in connection with the many editorial issues that came up.
Julia Driver, served Summer 2000–Summer 2013
Julia reviewed or advised us about the following entries: Envy, Happiness, Hedonism, Integrity, Justice as a Virtue, Loyalty, Perfectionism in Moral and Political Philosophy, Repugnant Conclusion, Respect, The Concept of Evil, Trust, Virtue Ethics, Weakness of Will, and Well Being. We’ll miss her thorough but efficient manner in dealing with SEP tasks. We could always count on her for quick replies to our editorial questions.
Branden Fitelson, served Spring 2007–Spring 2013.
We’re indebted to Branden for all the enthusiasm and energy he brought to the SEP section on Formal Epistemology. During his tenure, he reviewed or advised us about the entries on The Problem of Induction, Formal Representations of Belief, Bayes’ Theorem, Inductive Logic, Bayesian Epistemology, Dutch Book Arguments, Instrumental Rationality, Pascal’s Wager, Carl Hempel, Formal Learning Theory, Confirmation, Interpretations of Probability, and Social Choice Theory.
Timothy Williamson, served Spring 2002–Spring 2013.
Tim advised the SEP and vetted entries in the philosophy of language section for over 10 years. He sent us comments or suggestions with respect to the entries: Challenges to Realism, Vagueness, Connectives, Reference, Intensional Transitive Verbs, Private Language, Sorites Paradox, Linguistic Innatism, Assertion, Quotation, Counterfactuals, Philosophy of Linguistics, Normativity of Meaning and Content, and Negation. It will be difficult to replace him.
Jennifer Saul, served Spring 2005–Winter 2012.
Jennie worked on a large number of SEP entries, and helped to move the Feminism section of the SEP forward after Sally Haslanger retired from the Editorial Board, commissioning a wide variety of entries. We’re greatly indebted to her for her efforts. She refereed and sent comments on (updates to) the following entries, among others: Continental Feminism, Feminist Metaphysics, Feminist Epistemology and Philosophy of Science, Feminist History of Philosophy, Feminist Philosophy of Biology, Intersections Between Pragmatist and Continental Feminism, Feminist Perspectives on Sex Markets, Feminist Philosophy of Law, Feminist Perspectives on Science, Intersections Between Analytic and Continental Feminism, Feminist Perspectives on Sex and Gender, Feminist Political Philosophy, Feminist Bioethics, Feminist Perspectives on Rape, Feminist Perspectives on Objectification. We will miss the energy and enthusiasm she put into her editorship for the SEP.
Dean Zimmerman, served Winter 1999–Winter 2012.
Dean was one of the first members of the team of co-editors for Metaphysics. He vetted the folllowing entries: Determinates vs. Determinables, Intrinsic vs. Extrinsic Properties, the Correspondence Theory of Truth, Existence, Death, Emergent Properties, Tropes, Change and Inconsistency, Time, The Problem of the Many, Object, Mereology, Boundary, Monism, Dispositions, Ontological Dependence, Materialism, and the Metaphysics of Mass Expressions. The SEP is greatly in his debt.
Tamar Rudavsky, served Summer 2003–Spring 2012.
Tamar helped us to organize a team of co-editors for Judaic Philosophy, and organized the main group of entries to be covered. She refereed the entries on Maimonides, The Influence of Islamic Thought on Maimonides, Elijah Delmedigo, Abraham Ibn Daud, Abraham Ibn Ezra, Judah Halevi, Avicebron (Ibn Gabirol), and Abner of Burgos, among others. Throughout her time on the board, she helped us refine the list of titles for this section. We’ll miss her enthusiasm and input.
Stephen Yablo, served November 1999–December 2011.
Stephen was among the very first group of metaphysics co-editors for the SEP, and helped to set the direction of the section by suggesting and commissioning numerous entries. He vetted our entries on: abstract objects, modal fictionalism, events, Zeno’s paradoxes, realism, metaphysics of causation, logic and ontology, identity over time, transworld identity, essential vs. accidental properties, and facts. We’re extremely grateful for all the effort he put into the SEP.
Chris Swoyer, served October 1999–December 2011.
Chris worked with Philip Kitcher to help establish the SEP’s section on general philosophy of science. He refereed the entries on laws of nature, truthlikeness, scientific realism, scientific explanation, social dimensions of scientific knowledge, models in science, historicist theories of rationality, interpretations of probability, formal learning theory, probabilistic causation, unity of science, and philosophy of computer science. We’re indebted to him for his wide-ranging expertise and willingness to take on the refereeing tasks we assigned him.
Tommy Lott, served March 2004–November 2011.
Tommy helped to shape the structure of the SEP listings on African and African-American philosophy. He laid the groundwork for the development of this section, setting high standards. He vetted entries on African Sage Philosophy and Akan Philosophy of the Person. He put in a lot of effort on drafts of entries that never made it to publication.
Larry BonJour, served December 1997–April 2011.
Larry was the SEP’s first editor for articles in epistemology. He commissioned, and refereed, our core set of entries in epistemology. We are indebted to him for his expert judgment in bringing the following entries to publication: social epistemology, Bayesian epistemology, virtue epistemology, naturalized epistemology, coherentism, skepticism, foundationalist theories of epistemic justification, epistemological problems of memory, evolutionary epistemology, the analysis of knowledge, epistemic closure principle, epistemic basing relation, epistemological problems of testimony, and internalist vs externalist theories of epistemic justification. Larry also contributed the SEP’s entry on Epistemological Problems of Perception. Larry helped the SEP become one of the first places to look for work on epistemology.
Liam Murphy, served September 1998–October 2010.
Liam has helped to build up the section on the philosophy of law from scratch. He vetted entries including constitutionalism, the nature of law, law and ideology, causation in the law, legal rights, naturalism in legal philosophy, interpretivist theories of law, legal positivism, theories of tort law, legal obligation and authority, theories of contracts, precedent and analogy in legal reasoning, legal punishment, criminal law, economic analysis of law, etc. His range and expertise has been of great value to the SEP. We’re very much in his debt.
Eckhard Keßler, served Summer 2003–Fall 2010.
Eckhard Keßler served as a subject editor for Renaissance and 16th Century Philosophy. He vetted the entries on Heinrich Cornelius Agrippa von Nettesheim; Cusanus, Nicolaus [Nicolas of Cusa]; Niccolò Machiavelli, Francesco Patrizi of Cherso, Michel de Montaigne, Giovanni Pico della Mirandola, Galileo Galilei, Pietro Pomponazzi, Bernardino Telesio, Nicolaus Copernicus, Aristotelianism in the Renaissance, and Desiderius Erasmus. We will miss his input.
Guido Bacciagaluppi, served January 2001–July 2010.
Guido did an outstanding job, taking over the entres on Philosophy of Physics [Quantum Mechanics] shortly before Rob Clifton’s untimely death. He brought the section to fruition, and vetted the entries on Bohmian Mechanics, Quantum Entanglement and Information, Collapse Theories, Many-Worlds Interpretation of Quantum Mechanics, The Uncertainty Principle, Relational Quantum Mechanics, Quantum Logic and Probability Theory, Copenhagen Interpretation of Quantum Mechanics, and many others. We are indebted to Guido for his service and contribution to the SEP.
Helen Nissenbaum, served October 2000–June 2010.
Helen helped us to map out an SEP subject area of applied ethics, namely, Ethics and Information Technology. She commissioned and refereed the entries titled Computer Ethics, Computing and Moral Responsibility, Phenomenological Approaches to Ethics and Information Technology, and the Philosophy of Technology.
Kenneth Taylor, served December 1997–September 2009.
Ken played an important role as the SEP’s first subject editor for Philosophy of Language. He commissioned and refereed entries on Anaphora, Descriptions, Implicature, Indexicals, Logical Form, Quotation, and Reference.
Margaret (Maggie) Little, served Summer 2005–Summer 2009.
Maggie served as a subject editor for the Biomedical Ethics. The entries she worked on included Cloning, Disability, Disability and Health Care Rationining, Donation and Sale of Human Organs, Ethics and Pregnancy, Feminist Biothics, Justice, Inequality, and Health, Mental Illness, Parenthood and Procreation, Philosophy of Childhood, Philosophy for Children, Philosophy of Psychiatry, Privacy and Medicine, Race and Health, The Principle of Beneficence in Applied Ethics, Theory and Bioethics, and Voluntary Euthanasia. She had a significant impact on the coverage in this area and we will miss her insightful advice.
Sean Kelly, served August 2003–September 2008.
Sean served as part of the co-editorial team for 20th century Continental Philosophy. He helped referee entries on existentialism, and Karl Jaspers.
Paul Vincent Spade, served January 1997–September 2008.
Paul has been one of the longest serving subject editors for the SEP. He was part of the original group of philosophers who joined the SEP Editorial Board when it was first formed. We are indebted to him for organizing the subject area of Medieval Philosophy. Paul took responsibility for refereeing 30 SEP entries, and indeed wrote 4 entries himself, including the main entry on medieval philosophy. He helped to advise us on the selection of co-editors, and with the help of these co-editors, the SEP now has 79 published or assigned entries in Medieval Philosophy. We will certainly miss Paul’s authoritative assessments of the field, as well as his keen eye for what an authoritative reference work entry should be.
Joseph Raz, served Summer 1999–Fall 2007.
Joseph joined Liam Murphy as co-editor in 1999 (replacing Ronald Dworkin), and the two of them subsequently vetted jointly all the primary entries in the philosophy of law section of the SEP. These include: Legal Rights, Theories of Contracts, Causation in the Law, Theories of Criminal Law, Legal Punishment, The Nature of Law, The Pure Theory of Law, The Limits of Law, Naturalism in Legal Philosophy, Legal Realisms, Legal Positivism, Legal Obligation and Authority, Law and Language, Constitutionalism, Interpretation and Coherence in Legal Reasoning, The Economic Analysis of Law, Legal Principles of Restitution, Legal Philosophy: Its Aims and Methods, Interpretivist Theories of Law, Precedent and Analogy in Legal Reasoning, Law and Ideology, Theories of Tort Law, Natural Law Theories, The Rule of Law and Procedural Fairness, Property, and The Legal Concept of Evidence.
Linda Zagzebski, served Spring 2001–Spring 2008.
Linda played an important and influential role in developing the section on philosophy of religion in the SEP. She commissioned and refereed entries with the following titles: Afterlife, Concepts of God, Cosmological Argument, Divine Freedom, Emotions in the Christian Tradition, Eternity, Omnipresence, Philosophy of Religion, Pragmatic Arguments for Belief in God, Religion and Morality, Religion and Science, and Teleological Arguments for God’s Existence. It will be hard to replace her.
Lewis Ricardo Gordon, served 2003–2007.
Lewis came on board in 2003 to help Lucius Outlaw with the SEP section on African and African-American Philosophy. We’d like to thank him for the time he spent consulting with Tommy Lott, who replaced Lucius.
Sahotra Sarkar, served 2000–2006.
Sahotra played a seminal role in developing our philosophy of biology section. He refereed the entries on biodiversity, evolutionary genetics, gene, heredity and heritability, population genetics, the biological notion of self, and the genotype/phenotype distinction. We are indebted to him for his wide knowledge in the field and for his advice on how to develop the subject.
Huw Price, served 1996–2006.
Huw was the first philosopher from "down under" to join the SEP, and in the first years of the project, he helped to recruit talented and web-aware Australian philosophers. He subsequently became a subject editor for 20th century analytic philosophy, and refereed the entries on Wilfrid Sellars, Donald Davidson, the experience and perception of time, thermodynamic asymmetry in time, counterfactual theories of causation, the Vienna Circle, and others. Huw argued early on that we should be flexible about entry length so as to allow entries to go into more depth than in other reference works, and this had a significant affect on the development of the SEP.
Andrew Irvine, served 1995–2006.
Andrew was a visitor to CSLI when the SEP project started. He contributed some of the earliest entries in the SEP (Russell, Whitehead, Principia Mathematica, Russell’s Paradox) and in the first years of the SEP, helped to bring talented Canadian philosophers who were web-aware into the project. He subsequently became a co-editor for 20th century analytic philosophy, and refereed the entries on Feyerabend, logical constructions, Jacques Maritain, Karl Popper, historicist theories of rationality, Richard Rorty, L.E.J. Brouwer, G.E. Moore, Isaiah Berlin, and Ludwig Wittgenstein. We are grateful to Andrew for his many years of service and both steady and sound advice.
David Velleman, served 1998–2005.
David co-edited the entries on the philosophy of action, and to that end, not only helped to develop the basic list of topics in this subject area but also helped us to identify prospective authors for those topics. He set high standards and his comments helped shaped the entries on action and personal autonomy.
Robert Pippin, served 1999–2005.
Robert co-edited the entries on 19th century philosophy, focusing principally on those relating to 19th century Continental Philosophy. He refereed the entries on Nietzsche, Kierkegaard, Hegel, Schleiermacher, Fichte, Reinhold, Schelling, Jacobi, Bauer, etc. We are in his debt for the high standards he maintained in this section.
Dan Brock, served 1999–2005.
Dan was the first editor in Applied Ethics, responsible for the subspecialty of Biomedical Ethics. He refereed the entries on voluntary euthanasia, parenthood, philosophy for children, philosophy of childhood, suicide, and mental illness.
Sally Haslanger, served 1997–2005.
Sally was the founding subject editor for entries on Feminist Philosophy. She helped to organize the entries so that they would fall into the categories of "approaches to feminism", "feminist interventions", and "topics in feminism". In addition, she refereed the first group of entries on feminism that came online.
Margaret Atherton and David Owen, served from 1999 to 2004.
Margaret and David together laid a solid basis for the entries on 18th century philosophy, commissioning and refereeing entries on all the major figures. We very much appreciate their efforts and we look forward to building on the foundation they laid.
Alan Code, served 1996–2004.
Alan was the founding subject editor for entries on Aristotle, and as such, served as a co-editor for entries on ancient philosophy. He commissioned and refereed the entries on Aristotle’s ethics, logic, mathematics, metaphysics, political theory, psychology, and rhetoric.
Nicholas Jolley, served 2000–2004.
During Nick’s three-year tenure, he not only commissioned but also approved for publication a number of important articles in his subject area; in addition to the more specialized articles, there are now general essays on such central figures as Locke, Malebranche, and Spinoza.
Lucius Outlaw, served 2003–2004.
Lucius made the first sketch of the list of entries for the section on African and African-American Philosophy in the SEP. Unfortunately, onerous administrative duties made it difficult for him to see his conception brought to fruition.
Alasdair Urquhart, served 1998–2003.
Alasdair Urquhart was the founding subject editor for entries on Non-Classical Logic. Alasdair was diligent in refereeing such entries as the ones on modal logic, intuitionistic logic, temporal logic, relevance logic, paraconsistent logic, provability logic, many-valued logic, infinitary logic, substructural logics, and category theory.
John Burgess, served 1997–2003.
John Burgess was the founding subject editor for entries on Classical Logic. John helped to organize the entries for this subject, refereed the entries on classical logic, first-order model theory, infinitary logic, model theory, set theory, and the mathematics of Boolean algebra.
Philip Kitcher, served 2000–2003.
Philip worked with Chris Swoyer to help set up the SEP’s initial list of topics on the philosophy of science. He helped to vet the entries on scientific realism and scientific progress.
Brian Copenhaver, served Winter 1998–Winter 2001.
Brian worked with Dennis Des Chene to lay out and establish the section on Renaissance and 16th Century Philosophy. We’re grateful for his work.
Dennis Des Chene, served Winter 1998–Spring 2001.
Dennis worked with Brian Copenhaver to lay out and establish the section on Renaissance and 16th Century Philosophy. We’re grateful for his work.
Kwame Anthony Appiah, served Fall 1998-Winter 2000.
By laying out the initial list of topics for the African and African-American Philosophy section, suggesting authors for the entries for these topics, and suggesting the next subject editor, Kwame Anthony Appiah helped to establish the scope and structure of this section. We benefited from his advice.
Jonathan Kvanvig, served Fall 1999–Fall 2000.
Jonathan helped to establish the scope and structure of the philosophy of religion subject area of the SEP. He also helped us recruit the subject editors for this area. We are grateful for his efforts.
Peter Simons, served 1997–2001.
Originally a consulting editor, and then a founding subject editor for metaphysics at the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. Peter served from April 1997 to December 2001, primarily helping to create the list of 80 topics in Metaphysics, and offering advice and suggestions about authors. We have benefited a lot from the time, effort and insight he gave to the encyclopedia.
Rob Clifton (b. 1964, d. 2002), served 1997–2000.
Founding subject editor for philosophy of physics at the Stanford Encyclopedia of Philosophy. He served from April 1997 to December 2000, specializing in entries on quantum theory. Rob not only organized the topics on quantum theory, but also commissioned approximately 25 entries. Rob was one of the first philosophers to recognize the worth of the Encyclopedia and he helped set our exacting editorial standards. Rob’s energy and example attracted the best scholars to the Editorial Board. His love of philosophy and commitment to rigor of thought inspired every author he commissioned and is reflected in every article he edited.