Supplement to Emmanuel Levinas
Supplements to Emmanuel Levinas
- S.1 Transcendence and Being
- S.2 Levinas and Contemporary Ethics
- S.3 Levinas’ Hermeneutics
- S.4 Commentators on Levinas’ Politics
- S.5 Hermeneutics and Jewish Philosophy
- S.6 Politics and the State
- S.7 Justice and the State
- S.8 Essays after Otherwise than Being
S.1 Transcendence and Being
It bears recalling that, in phenomenology, light plays figurative and literal roles, from Husserl’s daylight as the condition for optimal perception (Ideas II §18) to his metaphor for the intentional “ray” directed like a spotlight upon an object, to Heidegger’s lighted opening that is Da-sein itself (BT: 171). Levinas in turn underscores the ‘work’ of light as able to suspend, phenomenologically, the traditional distinction between subjective and objective: “due to the light an object, while coming from without, is already ours in the horizon which precedes it” (EE: 41). Consequently, intelligibility is well figured by light. Phenomenological evidence is guaranteed by lighted circumstances—albeit for someone. Whereas Heidegger defined Da-sein almost operationally (“by its very nature, Dasein brings its ‘there’ along with it” [BT: 171]), Levinas returns to the Moderns’ principle “every object presupposes a subject”. Moreover, while the being of Da-sein is itself light and “disclosedness” (BT: 171), the being of Levinas’ hypostasis is characterized by its living cycle of drowsing, sleeping, waking, and acting. Thus, if being is equated with illumination, for Levinas it must also include the dark anonymity of night (EE: 54). It is both gift (Heidegger’s es gibt) and “there is” (Blanchot’s il y a, as taken up by Levinas). Consequently, the question that inaugurates fundamental ontology: Why is there being instead of simply nothing? is not Levinas’ primary concern. Nothingness, understood as pure absence, may be thinkable, but it cannot be experienced. Indeterminate, nocturnal being remains “something”. As the “there is”, being fills in all spatial and temporal intervals, whereas consciousness arises out of it thanks to its self-originating awakening and focus. This is Levinas’ first comprehensive sketch of being as a totality, in which the self-ego dyad appears as the limited transcendence of neutral being. Over the course of his analyses, this self-ego will hearken to a call. However, the call comes not from being but from an alterity that Levinas compares with death itself. “Just as with death, I am not concerned with an existent, but with the event of alterity” (TO: 87, emph. added). With “the event of alterity”, however, there is the call of the other person, notably female, experienced as desire, need, even generosity.[50] These works set the stage for later descriptions of world, facticity, time as now-moment, transcendence in immanence, and transcendence toward a future fecundity in the family. They constitute the core of Levinas’ first major work, Totality and Infinity: An Essay on Exteriority.
S.2 Levinas and Contemporary Ethics
Michael Morgan has discussed Levinas’ existential basis of ethics in relation to the three ethical schools (2007): deontology, virtue ethics, and utilitarism. He reminds us that Levinas is working at a pre-theoretical and embodied level that represents the impetus behind ethical systems forged through reflection, tradition, and critique. In that sense, Levinas’ objective is simultaneously phenomenological and hermeneutical: he describes the encounter with the other, argues that it imposes a limit on object constitution, and interpretively traces ethics back to the birth of intersubjective meaning. As opposed to Heidegger’s inaugural question of being, Levinas’ concern is with the exteriority or transcendence of the other who addresses me. Consistent with Morgan’s claim, Diane Perpich has argued that the face-to-face in Levinas gives rise to a “normativity without norms” (2008: 126–127). For his part, Steven Crowell observes that the normativity of the face is also epistemic; it is the ground for the objectivity of any perception because, if the other did not face me and call my experience into question, I would never encounter a “sense of the normative, of standards against which the validity of my experiences can be judged” (Crowell 2015: 574). Indeed, the first normativity I experience, prior to reflection, corresponds to an affect (TI 294), which accompanies my experience of the other’s exteriority. At the same time, I respond to that other. As Levinas writes,
[l]anguage makes possible the objectivity of objects and their thematization. Already Husserl argued that the objectivity of thought consists in being valid for everyone. To know objectively is therefore to constitute my thought in such a way that it already contain[s] a reference to the thought of others. What I communicate therefore is already constituted in function of others. (TI 210, emph. added)
Thus, Levinas’ existential phenomenology of the face-to-face is relevant to contemporary ethics above all insofar as ethics is concerned with its own grounds in lived intersubjectivity. We can even note parallels between Levinas and some contemporary ethicists. For example, the neo-Kantian, Onora O’Neill, bases the rationality of practical reason on a “minimal but authoritative demand”, which implies that the ethical principles I espouse never be irrational so that another person could not similarly adopt them. Levinas might say that the “authority” motivating such demands is experienced like an effect of the other’s transcendence (O’Neill 1996: 51–57). Moral intuitionists like David Wiggins and John McDowell have, similarly to Levinas, focused on our sensibility when it comes to grasping moral truths. In discussing authentic education, McDowell argues that acquiring an ethical sensibility makes possible our intuitions of what is right and good. It even fosters a flourishing rational will able to discern bona fide ethical requirements (McDowell 1998; Wiggins 1987 [1998]). Both McDowell and Wiggins share with Levinas an effort to enrich the perspective on the subject as a purely rational agent, although Levinas reconstructs the existential, relational origins of that agency.
It goes without saying that the philosophical influences and debates of the above-mentioned ethicists are different from Levinas’. Despite this difference, however, Morgan (2007) and Jean-Michel Salanskis have both underscored the importance—for the justification of any ethics—of scrutinizing its existential conditions. Salanskis asserts that Levinas’ arguments tally with what he calls the “requirements to which any philosophical exposition of morality must respond”. Ethics must
favor the … designation of an objective duty, not relative to a subjective or psychological trace (such relativity being precursive to the dissolution of morality pure and simple). [Moreover] duty must be felt; it is not really duty unless it is mine. (Salanskis 2006: 63, my trans.)
If ethics refers to the study or to a system of moral principles, then Levinas provides a phenomenology of the everyday genesis of these principles. Salanskis calls this “a new philosophy of morality” (2006: 31–73).
In turn, Gabriela Basterra has recalled that Kant’s moral law, understood as the basis of a positive feeling and as the object of our greatest respect (Achtung) is cognized a priori, and even the respect we experience for it is not of empirical origin. Respect is thus a unique affect that motivates my will to follow the moral law, though it is not a feeling in an empirical psychological sense (Kant 1788 [2002]). Instead, it is something that affects me, and Basterra compares it to the affection that Levinas identifies as the interruption of my activity by the other who faces me (Basterra 2015). Once again, the two philosophies are different, notably because they entail distinct approaches. But it remains that, like Kant’s a priori, we cannot assimilate the motivation experienced before the face of the other to a subjective state or to an objective concept.
S.3 Levinas’ Hermeneutics
Despite his debt to Heidegger, Levinas stands closer here to the French existentialists whose conception of the corporeal self is intersubjective and moral (PP 372–373). However, unlike Charles Taylor, influenced by Merleau-Ponty, Levinas does not endorse a plurality of strong values, because the encounter with the other is the primary condition for him. While the French existentialists were frequently atheists, or in a few cases, carried a certain Christian spirituality, a debate has been ongoing for over a decade about Levinas’ philosophy and its relationship to Judaism. It has been suggested that Levinas’ critique of Heidegger’s ontology as a “philosophy of the Neuter” (TI 298) relies on decisive attention paid to the influence of “Jerusalem” over that of “Athens” in the Western philosophical tradition. Scholars like Shmuel Trigano have traced a number of crucial Levinasian “philosophemes” to Jewish positions, notably as expressed by Philo and Maimonides (Trigano 2002: 145–178). On the other hand, commentators like Leora Batnitzky have argued that, when compared with the thought of Leo Strauss, for whom Jewish philosophy still holds a place for “revelation”, Levinas’ work largely rehabilitates the tradition of Modern philosophy—and with it a secular, almost political, project (Batnitzky 2006: 4). Despite this, and in light of Totality and Infinity, she comes close to Trigano when she argues that Levinas tends to ignore important political questions, including that of the Jewish State, which has consequences for his thought, because
to think politics is urgent in an undertaking [such as Levinas’], since it amounts to thinking through the criterion of ethical validity of the universalization project … with regard to the other and with regard to self …. (2006: 173–174)
Levinas’ recourse to Descartes’ Meditations may well justify Batnitzky’s qualifying his thought as Modern. More important is this: Levinas’ argument that ethics is first philosophy (TI 29, 47, 304) runs into the difficulty of universalizing our pre-intentional “experience” of spontaneous responsibility toward the other. That would imply that first philosophy begins from a transcendental stance rather than through analysis or deduction.
S.4 Commentators on Levinas’ Politics
Commentators have taken various positions on Levinas’ politics. Most recently, Robert Froese defended Levinas’ ethical encounter against neo-liberal and Marxian critiques. Froese argues that the face-to-face encounters “always already take place against the larger political background”, but they add a precious supplement missing in many political philosophies: the possibility of a “normative standpoint from which political struggle appears both as an analytical necessity, and an ethical imperative” (Froese 2020: 15–16). By definition, then, resistance to injustice—including in political spheres—inheres in what we might otherwise take as an ethical imperative that originates with the other.
Howard Caygill’s Levinas and the Political was the first systematic, critical study of the question of the de facto politics in Levinas’ thought. Caygill emphasized inconsistencies in Levinas’ texts on politics and Israel, and pointed to his “problematic fusion of rabbinics and Hegelianism” (2002: 79–93). Annabel Herzog (2020) has argued recently that even the limited politics of the Talmudic readings entails a debt to Hegel. More in line with Levinas’ thought, Morgan and Salanskis have urged that politics can stand within both history and a certain idealism, at least insofar as one understanding of “Israel” acknowledges Jewish particularity as carrying the possibility of universalization, thanks precisely to the Biblical prophets’ call for justice (Morgan 2016 250ff; Salanskis 2006; see also Salanskis 2017). It bears noting that by 1984 Levinas will be less skeptical toward European liberal States, and more willing to trace the genealogy of liberalism back to a Biblical conception of responsibility. In “Peace and Proximity” (TEI), he ventured,
Europe is not a simple confluence of two cultural currents. It is the concreteness where theoretical and biblical wisdom do better than converge. The relation with the other … that is, with peace[,] comes a reason that thematizes, synchronizes, and synthesizes, that thinks a world and reflects on being, concepts necessary for the peace of humanity. (TEI 168)
S.5 Hermeneutics and Jewish Philosophy
Like Fagenblat, scholars from David Banon to Marc-Alain Ouaknin to François-David Sebbah have explored the hermeneutic dimension of Levinas’ thought, even beyond his Talmudic readings that delve into the many-voiced debates between the rabbis of the Mishna and the Gemara (the oldest and subsequent transcriptions of Jewish oral traditions) (Banon 1987; for an expanded discussion of this, see Banon 2022). Indeed, as Ouaknin points out, in the case of Talmudic and Biblical hermeneutics, Levinas always considered the eminence of a book—what defines it as “the Book”—to be less its themes than its structure. Levinas focuses “on the structure of the Book of books inasmuch as it allows for exegesis [hermeneutics], and on its unique status of containing more than it contains” (Ouaknin (1993, 1995) cites Levinas “On the Jewish Reading of Scriptures” in BTV 109).
Hermeneutics is thus engendered by excesses of potential meaning over senses already printed on the page, or even discerned by the reception traditions of the work. It would thus be the specific architecture of the book that conditions its reception. Moreover, the parallelisms that we have seen—between the Saying and the Said and between temporal diachrony and synchrony—are also found at the literary level in Biblical and Talmudic texts, with their openness to ongoing interpretation. Levinas even equates “revelation” with the call of the text to each reader or listener, who thereby becomes responsible for its interpretation. “The Revelation as calling to the unique within me is the significance particular to the signifying of the Revelation” (BTV133) of the text, which is understood as dialogical to its core. Here we see the structural analogy between the call of the other and my response that begins as Saying, as opening to words addressed. Levinas adds,
the totality of the true is constituted from the contribution of multiple people, the uniqueness of each act of listening carrying the secret of the text; the voice of the Revelation, as inflected … by each person’s ear, would be necessary to the ‘Whole’ of the truth. (BTV 133–134)
Hermeneutic truth here becomes the responsibility of an open community, as much as an invitation to participation extended to each possible listener. That is why Levinas could urge that Scripture be understood as a call to respond as readily as could proximity, substitution, and responsibility, all of which similarly express an ethical investiture that results in words offered. The here and now of scriptural voices and reading stands analogous to the here and now of the face-to-face encounter and the fact that memory occurs by definition in the present.
Levinas’ hermeneutics might nevertheless be deemed immanent, concerning one book and one community. Although commentators like Batnitzky find in Levinas a project for a modern politics, and thus for universality, others are skeptical about her claim. Trigano objects that Levinas’ ethics unfolds out of a sort of non-site, starting with the category of the singular. “For Levinas”, he argues,
it is ethically imperative to think the singular in order that the horizon of the other person arise. The universal is, in effect, a dangerous game that can lead to totality and to the negation of the other person. To decide in favor of the singular is to avoid such a development
and with it, a politics (Trigano 2002: 173). Robert Froese (2020) argues that we can derive a utopian politics form Levinas’ hermeneutics, provided that we understand the levels of subjectivity he explores, including the affective and pre-conscious level in which original intersubjectivity is born. This requires mobilizing a genetic phenomenological method. And perhaps for that reason, it has been largely missed by left and liberal readers who see in Levinas “a pure ideological fantasy” (Froese 2020: 4), one that readily aligns with neoliberalism. As Froese insists, however,
the social bond between subjects is not predicated on a common experience or shared horizon of meaning, but simply the experience of the self, as a self, is necessarily mediated in and through others (2020: 12)
without this understanding, there is little way to mobilize Levinas’ philosophy as a critique of politics.
In sum, the hermeneutic and phenomenological turn that Levinas gives to Husserl and Heidegger has led to debates about the relationship between an immanent hermeneutics and one concerned with politics as the sphere of the universal. Annabel Herzog argues in the same vein as Froese, for a Jewish and Levinasian universalism, provided we accept her thesis that ethics and politics mutually interrupt each other—with ethics urging us toward a “surplus of responsibility” and politics representing the inescapable context and risk that besets responsibility. To demonstrate her claim, Herzog engages an extensive study of the politics of the law as debated in the Talmud and presented in Levinas’ Talmudic readings (Herzog 2020: 38–57, 94–119). These questions imply discussions about politics in our time from which Levinas would have refrained in his time, in the wake of the Shoah, when politics seemed less important than questions of the survival and future of Jewish communities. Be that as it may, even objections that claim to be phenomenological and not ideological (Drabinski 2011: 41) fail to emphasize that phenomenology itself contains a Cartesian egology, with transcendental and lifeworld egoic layers, as well as a psychological level derived from the embodied experience of affectivity, including intersubjective affects.
Much of the debate about Levinas’ politics unfolded successively in France and then in the English-speaking world. Michel Haar (1991: 530) asked of Levinas whether his ethics could really unfold outside any site, outside any positive reciprocity, and outside all objectivation (cited by Trigano 2002: 175, note 79). Trigano criticizes Levinas, urging that the dialectical relationship between singular experience and universal meaning (and institutions) implies that philosophy should have a minimal relationship to politics (Trigano 2002: 176). On Trigano’s account, it follows that Levinas’ hermeneutics only partly responded to Jews’ post-war need for the universalization of their experience, at a human level encompassing both theory and politics (Trigano 2002: 176). This does not contradict Batnitzky’s reading, which considers Levinas’ œuvre as a whole. But it can be argued that universalization in Levinas’ ethics remains largely formal. On this question turns the important matter of what it means to develop a Jewish philosophy today.
Numerous are the objections to what we could call Levinas’ “genetic hermeneutics”. Terry Eagleton (2009), Slavoj Žižek (2005), and Simon Critchley (2004), among others, have read Levinas as though the face-to-face encounter represented a retreat into private life without reference to or concern for social and political existence. Froese speaks, by contrast, in terms of “entanglement” (2020: 11), echoing Levinas’ own arguments that the social-structural dimension of our relationship to alterity is itself impoverished when we neglect the “pre-subjective plane of analysis”, made possible through genetic phenomenology (2020: 11). Sebbah (2018a) also emphasizes Levinas’ hermeneutic argument for the “separation” that defines the subject in the world; this must be taken seriously throughout. Stated otherwise, the subject is in the world yet not wholly of the world:
The true interiority is nothing of the world and certainly not as an “inside” that would be “situatable” in that world. Hope and responsibility—when nothing of the world remains standing, or only remains standing in the crude light of wretchedness—resists because they are neither of the world, nor of being. Hope and responsibility whereby, in a sense, interiority is evasion or escape itself. (Sebbah 2018a, 26)
S.6 Politics and the State
Needless to say, the notion of a just politics means different things according to the form of the State, whether totalitarian, authoritarian, or liberal.[51] Given his evocations of a pluralist or multilayered existence in Totality and Infinity (TI 19, 80, 306), Levinas’ argument that justice is marked by the trace of responsibility seems to accord relatively well with liberal theories of political justice. Although it is less clear where the conception of freedom in these theories stands with regard to Levinas. Anglo-American theorists of sovereignty and politics emphasize that individuals live in multiple social associations, which impose a host of responsibilities on them. Indeed liberalism’s dual concern with liberty and a pluralistic socio-political existence diminishes the emphasis on sovereignty as concentrated in the State alone, as well as any drift toward such concentration. As against authoritarianism, liberal traditions allow politics to offer a mirror image of responsibility in society. That is, it is not so much “thanks to God” that I am treated as an other by the others. Rather, it is thanks to the ongoing limitation of governing institutions by free citizens and their associations. In that sense, what is true of ethical responsibility is also true of the political recognition of my rights, including by other citizens. Thus Highlen’s recent claim that politics is the fulfillment of ethical obligation unfolds an important implication of Bernasconi’s urging that to establish a “direct contradiction” between ethics and politics amounts to erasing the public-private distinction. The idea, already present in Totality and Infinity, that politics is indeed implicit in the ethical encounter represents an insightful response to left-leaning criticisms of Levinas (Froese 2020: 3-7, discussing Terry Eagleton [2009] and Slavoj Žižek [2006]). However, a difference of structure must be maintained between everyday experience and intentionality on the one hand, and their pre-conscious intersubjective conditions, on the other hand.
Returning briefly to the theme of pluralism, recall that, following his comprehensive comparison of Levinas’ philosophy with contemporary theories of ethics, Michael Morgan admits:
I do not think that Levinas would favor any particular moral system—say, some form of Kantian morality or of consequentialism, insofar as it is a system. (2007: 456, emph. added)
This is likely true of any politics as well, that attempts to forge systems—or, as Levinas says, to totalize (TI 15, 21, 292–305). Recently, Jean-Michel Salanskis has argued that, as the life of a people, Jewish communities provide an “idealist horizon liable to interest all of humanity”, because they tie this horizon narratively “to a practical and intellectual testing ‘laboratory.’” (Salanskis 2016: 129, note 68). The latter amounts to everyday life with the moral allegories of the Bible and the pluralism of voices in the Talmud. For example, in Levinas’ important Talmudic reading entitled “messianic texts” (DF 1963), he justifies the creation of a Jewish State on the basis of the possibility of protecting both messianic waiting and a Talmudic education to responsibility, despite the violence implicit in Israel’s becoming one State among others, within universal and secular history (also see Morgan 2016: 256–265, responding to Kavka 2015).
S.7 Justice and the State
Having focused on the relationship between a community and a state, or on a people colonized and an empire, let us look more directly at the question of justice within Jewish thought. Although it is hyperbolic to speak of one Jewish philosophical tradition, notably a modern one, the question of justice forms the core of the prophetic strain in Jewish political thought. Recalling Highlen’s important distinction between State peace and the peace flowing from responsibility for others, answering the question of politics in Levinas’ ethics depends on his phenomenology of intersubjectivity traced back to its affective pre-conditions. It is this that motivates the aforementioned prophetic strain, understood minimally as the call by a witness for justice. François-David Sebbah and Sarah Hammerschlag have both returned to Levinas’ captivity notebooks wherein he jotted his wartime insights into Judaism as he lived it then:
J. [might be compared to] a splinter in the flesh. One might live without it, but if one didn’t have [this source of suffering], my life [would be deprived] of its acuity … or [have] fallen back into infancy. (LO1: 172, my trans.)
This conception of life and the suffering of injustice corresponds not so much to particular Jews, as to our human condition, provided we understand it as a condition largely received, passively and without our explicit choice. As Hammerschlag and Fagenblat have urged, this human pathos, consistent with a pluralistic ontology, should be approached as an existential category (Hammerschlag 2012: 389–419).[52] Sebbah acknowledges the situation of passive suffering, counts it as terrible, but emphasizes that in the midst of this passion, we glimpse the specificity of the human, which is also to “believe in the return of values, in a ‘feeling oneself responsible’ for these values, [even] when outside they [the values] have collapsed with everything else outside” (Sebbah 2018a, 26)—notably with all justice. This is why Judaism can be a figure for suffering humanity and, by extension, can be an ontological category. Hence, Levinas characterized Judaism as “an understanding of being”, rather than as a religion. This category may surprise us if we overlook the fact that a definitive part of our existence comes from without us, i.e., through the internalization of the life of our community, its founding texts, as also through social and political appraisals of us (e.g., antisemitism, racism, sexism). It is to their credit, of course, that both left-leaning critiques of Levinas and what Froese calls the “third wave” (2020: 7–9), including critical race theory, have pointed to Levinas’ neglect of such external forces. It is less likely, however, that such neglect implies a surreptitious commitment to conservative ideology (2020: 9). For, these critics overlook Levinas’ abiding preoccupations with the condition of possibility—a strange condition, to be sure—of our internalizing a host of social and symbolic forces: passivity, or what might be called “the non-intentional structure of interhuman entanglement” (2020: 10; also see Bloechl 2022). But let us return to Judaism as an ontological category in light of this passivity.
When approached as unbidden passivity, the existential category called Judaism raises the question of other passive ascriptions and their implications for the question of what it means to be a human being. If, by 1974, politics and the third party are largely synonyms for “humanity” for Levinas, then we must conclude that politics has, by extension, become more for him than the conflict and strife he described in his preface to Totality and Infinity (TI 21–25). Politics would have to take seriously a pluralistic humanism, as well as the condition of passive conditions of ascriptions including racism and antisemitism. The upshot is that one may sometimes have a choice about whether politics is indeed a war of all against all or the site in which justice toward the other can be demanded. Some commentators have raised the concern that “humanity” for Levinas looks basically like Husserl’s rationalist ideal of humanity (Husserl 1935 [1970], cited by McGettigan 2006: 16). This would be the humanity of Europe, and beneath that, one flowing out of the intertwined voices of “Athens” and “Jerusalem” (cf. Eisenstadt 2019).[53] To be sure, the Biblical prophets demanded justice (and repentance) from their wayward communities. But political justice requires a public space including the homogeneity imposed by citizenship. This is like the agora in which agorein (public speaking) gives rise to categories of thought (kat’agorein means to accuse publicly). The very notion of a category, including that of humanity, would thus flow from the multiple crossings of Greek and Jewish traditions resulting in a European humanism that mobilizes the ethical witness of the prophet and the parrhesia or truth-telling of the citizen in the public square.
S.8 Essays after Otherwise than Being
Subsequent to Otherwise than Being, Levinas’ own works return to and refine his major themes. These works include Transcendence and Intelligibility (1984), In the Time of the Nations (1988), Entre Nous (1991), and Alterity and Transcendence (1995), all of which are collections of essays from various periods between 1951 and 1989. However, the first of these collections to appear, entitled Of God Who Comes to Mind (1982), contains the important essay “God and Philosophy” (1975; OGCM: 55–78), which is a critical confrontation with the God of Descartes and Malebranche, and a subtle debate with Heidegger. This essay is followed by the transcript of a two-hour discussion with professors from the University of Leyden (OGCM: 79–99), in which social problems infrequently addressed by Levinas in his philosophy are raised.[54] Despite the wide temporal gamut run by these publications, we find few new developments, other than a clearer resolve to address the ambiguity intrinsic to the signifier “God” (OGCM: §§10–13, 17–19), and the verbal dynamics of being (corresponding to Heidegger’s Wesen), henceforth characterized by Levinas’ neologism in which the dynamism of the verb esse persists into the noun “essance” (OGCM: 43–51).
In 1982, eight years after the publication of Otherwise than being, Levinas appears to reformulate somewhat his conception of justice. We should, nevertheless, not conceive of this as a change in his appraisal so much as the opening of a different perspective. In an interview entitled “Philosophy, Justice, and Love” (EN 103–122). He argues,
I do not live in a world where there is but one “first come”. There is always a third [party] in the world; he too is my other, my neighbor. Consequently, it matters to me to know which of the two passes first … Justice is thus prior here to taking the other’s fortunes upon oneself. (EN 103–104, emph. added)
The supposed priority of the other would consequently depend on both situation and perspective, which can of course be ethical or socio-juridical. Now, Levinas was aware of this ambiguity, as he signaled it already in 1974 by misquoting Isaiah 57:19, deliberately inverting the order of the terms, “neighbor” and “the one far away”. He thus writes, “Peace to the neighbor and to the distant one” (OBBE: 157). Eleven years later, he “corrects” the citation in an interview entitled “On Jewish Philosophy” (1985; ITN: 167–183): “‘Peace, peace, to him that is far off and to him that is near’, says the Eternal”. And he adds,
Outside the one who is near … he who is far off compels recognition. Outside the other there is the third party. He is also an other, also a neighbor. But which is the closest proximity? […] There must be knowledge of such things! (ITN: 172, emph. added; cf. Frost 2022: 78–82)[55]
Given the 1974 rapprochement drawn between the third party and illeity, as well as the Talmudic readings, it is clear that Levinas is never insensitive to social existence and the need to moderate infinite responsibility. To be sure, he co-presence, other and third party, observed on the basis of synchrony or clock time, does not mean that proximity holds no priority for him. However the other is not ambiguous in the precise way that the third party is. The latter points to the community, to other others, but it also echoes Biblical allegories. Levinas cites Psalm 82: “God stands in the divine assembly, among the divine beings. He pronounces judgment”. Even though the third, when understood as illeity, refers to a transcendent enigma, viz., “God in the divine assembly”, the everyday social function of the third party, as inciting judgment, coexists with a regulative idea that preserves a trace of transcendence. That is also why justice can be an ideal and can find itself distorted in practice. Luc Anckaert observes that “the pursuit of justice [in the everyday sense] brings about evil in a paradoxical way”, through blindness toward the practical or political implications of the ideal itself (2020: 71).
Levinas’ reference to Psalm 82 is less surprising than we might suppose. Echoing Carl Schmitt’s Political Theology, Fagenblat points out that all the important concepts in modern statehood theory are secularized religious ideas. Moreover the secularization process does not stop with statehood theory, “a similar phenomenon applies to secular moral concepts” (Fagenblat 2010: xi, emph. added). As indicated above, “God” would be the time-honored name for an open site, a site of transcendence indispensable to justice when understood as an asymptotic approach to its idea. The allegorical reference to a “God” who judges is less a problem of secularization than a reason why under social circumstances, it is hard to maintain the priority of responsibility over justice. Some commentators have failed to acknowledge how deeply Levinas was aware of this tension (Franck 2008; Frost 2022). In “Philosophy, Justice, and Love”, Levinas draws a complex portrait of the third party as “God” based on a new, and crucial, distinction between the meaning of “God” as Elohim and “God” as the Tetragrammaton (YHWH; EN 108).[56] In the rabbinic tradition, Elohim, God of justice, first created the world. That world did not survive by itself; that is, without the “supplement” provided by YHWH, the God of mercy. Hence, the necessity of a second creation where justice was more than equal treatment—divine justice would not amount to mere equity. Again we note the ambiguity of the third party. This is close to what Faessler means by the excess intrinsic to the term “God”, that is reflected in the figure of glory (cf. Psalms 16: 9 and 57: 9) (Faessler 2021: 18).
Given the allegorical alignment of Elohim with justice, and YHWH with mercifulness, Levinas argues that illeity has two possible modalizations: justice or equity; mercy or compassion. The character of one God thus depends on the perspective we adopt: everyday justice would belong to ontology, compassion to an ethical perspective or justice enriched. For Fagenblat, the ethical priority emerges as the possibility of creating and safeguarding meaning—by extension, as creation tout court (2010: 44–53). Indeed, the theme of creation first arises in Levinas when in 1935 he praises Maimonides (Levinas 2008). Already there, for Levinas, what distinguishes the philosopher of Fez from the Aristotelians is precisely creation, the possibility of inaugurating a new act or process within being. To return, however, to the two receptions of creation according to rabbinic tradition, a world created first on justice (as equality and comparison) does not survive, because demands for equality (and with them, for blind justice) are unceasing and do not admit an outside or transcendent term allowing for considerations beyond horizontal comparison. It is the regulative idea, the outside-the-system as it were, that motivates justice to strive asymptotically towards ethics. That is why Levinas observes that being human means that we are certainly born into a social world, a world of many others and third parties. But we are sustained, and individuated, by compassion, by mercy born out of the call of the other. Mercy represents, for justice, the trace of responsibility. As indicated, this becomes clear when one ponders Levinas’ philosophy together with his Talmudic texts.
The important question of the priority of responsibility as against justice must thus be approached as a complex one, again dependent on lived circumstances. From the “metaphysical” perspective that Levinas defined as desire for the other in Totality and Infinity (TI 39), responsibility and proximity come first (EN 107–108). From the perspective of practice and our living-in-society, justice stands closer to ethics and may sometimes precede it. Gérard Bensussan has discussed this question in light of the Christian tradition in the West, for which Judaism always already represents an alterity—in text as in act; for example, when the Passover seder re-enacts the escape from enslavement in Egypt, it ritually recalls: “strangers we were, and thus, strangers we are”, even today (2008: 78). A more rigorously philosophical reckoning may require that the relationship between the two perspectives, justice and mercy, be further clarified in light of divine and secular justice. This is one point on which the Jewish writings of Levinas enrich, even ground, his philosophical arguments.
Some scholars have returned recently to Levinas’ Talmudic readings for a clearer conception of his politics and its evolution. In addition to Annabel Herzog, discussed above, Oona Eisenstadt has studied Levinas’ 1965 Talmudic reading, “promised land or permitted land?” (Eisenstadt 2019: 27) and shown that Levinas’ attitude toward politics in Europe as also in Israel—initially parallels the possibility of political self-critique, an Enlightenment legacy that unfolded first in, and then beyond, European culture. At that time, 1965, Levinas would have appraised Israel in these terms, essentially as “Europe writ small”. The study of holy texts and self-critique, then, together represented Levinas’ 1960s conception of Zionism—centrally, of a Zionism of conscience (Eisenstadt 2019: 30–32). As Eisenstadt points out, the 1965 Talmudic reading initially addresses discussion by the “sons of Israel” of the invasion of the land of Canaan (Numbers 13–14), laying emphasis on the question of proceeding or abstaining in light of the message by ten emissary spies. These are ultimately stricken with plague thereby punished for their counsel against invading the land that YHWH had promised to the Israelites. Levinas’ play of ambiguities in this reading urges that conquest is not without its price.
The Talmudic reading here presents the “realization of the upper limits of human political possibility” (Eisenstadt 2019: 35), given the abiding tension between universal justice and national justice. Levinas’ insistence that “the right of the native population to live is stronger than the moral right of the universal God” (Levinas NTR: 67) unfolds as the contestation of the right to a homeland that ignores the consequences of its seizure. This theme continues to the 1980s, modified by Levinas’ 1982 focus on the moral conscience of Tel Aviv protesters decrying the Lebanese Phalangists’ massacre at Sabra Shatila. From stark self-critique and a rhetorical defense of the spies in the Promised land, Levinas progressively alters his stance in what Eisenstadt urges is the passage of ethical responsibility into the field of the political (2019: 40).
[I]t takes two decades for him to bring the political and the anthropological fully into line such that in Levinas’ later thought a single governing structure obtains, whatever the topic. (2019: 40)
This perspective is expanded by Annabel Herzog, herself basing arguments on Talmudic readings, and pointing out that as readily as politics may interrupt ethics—since all manifestly ethical behavior occurs in some political space—ethics may extend into, and sometimes interrupt politics (Herzog 2020: 30–44).
Rafał Włodarczyk argues that we clearly gain “lessons in hospitality” from Levinas’ Talmudic readings. These translate his philosophical enterprise “into the language of the philosophy of education” (Włodarczyk 2021: 359; also see §3.1). Together with Hanan Alexander (2014), Włodarczyk observes that, thanks to the teaching of Shushani (see note 12), any dogmatic approach to the Talmud has today become impossible (359). By contrast with piety and dogmatism, we glimpse, in the reading entitled “Toward the Other”,
a key attitude of rabbinic tradition toward non-violence in a … significant way that stands in contrast [even] to rational account [Haskalah] of Jewish tradition … by opening the learner up to receiving those who are different as an act of self-understanding. (Alexander 2014: 59; Meir 2021 on trans-difference)
Whatever we make of this claim, the point is to approach the Talmudic readings as proceeding “beyond the perspective of particular religious education” (Włodarczyk 2021: 364). Włodarczyk chooses the reading entitled “Cities of Refuge” (1979 [BTV]), emphasizing that safe harbor is necessary, including for those who engage in involuntary manslaughter. They must be protected from subsequent acts of blood vengeance. Of course, such refuge is also ambiguous, for two reasons: each of us is a potential murderer and refuge can be experienced as exile (see Eisenstadt 2003). Włodarczyk compares the protection of the city of refuge, here framed as Jerusalem, with the hospitality of the home and the possibility of learning non-violence. Therein, “we have a footing. We are no longer submerged by events; we no longer fear the avenger of blood” (BTV 50). Thus,
[a]sylums create the conditions for awareness of the existence, impact and significance of the components of socialization in ordinary violence, through the cessation or weakening of their impact and through the potential to experience … the openness to otherness. (Włodarczyk 2021: 367–368)
On a contrasting note, Lisa Guenther ponders the ambiguity of residence in the framework of carceral systems. Within the context of “homeowner citizenship”, understood in light of gated communities and other carceral spaces, sites of lock-in or sites of lock-out, she demands how to conceive hospitality within fundamentally oppressive contexts (Guenther 2018).