1. Levinas will call the face-to-face relationship “meta-physical”. He does this repeatedly in Totality and Infinity. Cf. TI, 39–41; 64; 79–81. Also TI, p. 84. There he says

we have called this relation metaphysical. It is premature and…insufficient to qualify it, by opposition to negativity, as positive. It would be false to qualify it as theological.

By metaphysics, Levinas means an event that repeats in the everyday, but is not reducible to physical or “animal” life.

2. See for example Doyon & Breyer 2015 and Shapiro 2011. The work that first focused on sensibility in Levinas was Drabinski 2001.

3. It should be noted that Levinas makes the striking remark, at the end of his Theory of Intuition in Husserl’s Phenomenology:

Only Heidegger dares to face this problem deliberately, it having been considered impossible by the whole of traditional philosophy. This problem has for its object the meaning of the existence of being…and we feel justified in being inspired by him. (TOI: 154–155)

Some of the seminars of Heidegger from before Being and Time are now available in English. Levinas would have been familiar with them. Note Heidegger 1921–1922 [2001] and Heidegger 1923 [1999].

4. According to Husserl’s phenomenology, intentionality means that all consciousness is consciousness-of something. In the beginning is the relationship between intending act and, generally, the object intended. This event is a unity. It can be decomposed, analytically, into the act of intentional aiming and the sense constituted in that aiming. To be sure, not all intentional acts are object-constituting. Indeed, whether it is a question of a sensation, a perceived entity, a memory, or an abstract ideality (e.g., a mathematical equation), the constituted sense and the intention harmonize in the mode in which they are approached and given.

5. Some of these remarks were inspired by Robert Bernasconi’s lectures, “Thinking through the Difference between Immanence and Transcendence: Levinas, Bergson, and Deleuze”, Collegium Phænomenologicum, Città di Castello, Umbria, Italy, July 14–August 1, 2003. See Sallis et al. 1988, 257–272.

6. This volume, worked out between 1926 and 1927, and conceived originally as part of the plan for Being and Time, specifically the intended Division 3 of Part 1 supposed to be entitled “Time and Being”. Along with Kant and the Problem of Metaphysics (Heidegger 1929 [1997]), this work sketches Heidegger’s early departure from Husserl’s phenomenology, although it maintains the priority of Da-sein’s being-in-the-world for the question of transcendence.

7. Levinas was already exploring the notion of separation, as against participation, in a talk entitled “La séparation”, delivered on 3 December 1957. The concept aimed to maintain an open quality to any philosophical system, from ontology to idealist dialectics. In 1957, he would argue: “Separation breaks the totality, whether it be the unity of the concept or that of number” (LO2 165).

8. These works were prepared by notes taken during his captivity in the Fallingbostel officers’ camp, mainly between 1940 and 1945. See LO1 108, 134, 164 (Carnets 3, 5, and 6).

9. This hearkens to kabalistic and romantic speculation about the Biblical Tohu va-Vohu, the primordial chaos (or indeterminate presence) out of which light and order were created. It is a phenomenological interpretation thereof.

10. Work is, for Levinas, effort. In effort, the body is “simultaneously, transcendence, organ, and obstacle”. Just as it was for Maine de Biran (EDE 186, my trans.).

11. Recall that the being that we are (Da-sein) understands thanks to some mood that “makes manifest ‘how one is, and how one is faring’. In this ‘how one is’, having a mood brings Being to its ‘there’” (BT 173).

12. The proposed jury included his friend and mentor, Jean Wahl, and Maurice Merleau-Ponty (who died before the time of Levinas’ defense). Wahl was well versed in Heidegger, Anglo-Saxon philosophy, and German Idealism. Between the publication of his middle works and Totality and Infinity, Levinas was also initiated into intensive study of the Talmud by a mysterious wanderer, “Monsieur Chouchani”. An extraordinary dialectician, Shushani had been teaching Torah and Talmud since the 1930s in a synagogue in Paris. With him, Talmudic study prolonged humanist and rationalist tendencies already present in Levinas’ approach to Judaism (via Mittnagdism) and to the ethical core of the prophets. This approach, along with the ubiquitous influence of Rosenzweig SE (1921), inflects the thinking of Levinas’ 1961 work, Totality and Infinity, toward questions of ethics, justice, and the hermeneutics of fraternity.

13. “An absolute transcendence has to be produced as not integratable into knowledge or intentional constitution”. (TI 53.) Subsequently he adds, “A relation with what…comes absolutely from itself is needed to make possible the consciousness of radical exteriority” (TI 192). This is the relation with the other understood as she who speaks to me, or he whose regard has singled me out, before I ponder him as an empirical being. In 1984, Levinas goes so far as to say, “the notion of transcendence, of alterity, of absolute novelty” has a unique relation to knowledge which, beyond the ‘fit’ between consciousness and its objects, “calls to another phenomenology, though it be the destruction of the phenomenology of appearing and knowledge”, (TEI 17–18, my trans.).

14. In 1961, Levinas defines transcendence strictly in light of the other:

The being that presents himself in the face comes from a dimension of height, a dimension of transcendence whereby he can present himself as a stranger without opposing me as obstacle or enemy. (TI 215)

My responding to the other enacts a corresponding goodness.

[The] manifestation of the invisible [the unconstitutable dimension of the face as expression] cannot mean the passage of the invisible to the status of the visible; it…is produced in the goodness reserved to subjectivity. (TI 243)

15. Aristotle argues that “what is decent is superior” (Nicomachean Ethics 1137b 11), which means receiving less than one’s due and offering more than is required.

16. This is in line with many of Merleau-Ponty’s analyses, some of them inspired by Husserl. To be sure, Merleau-Ponty himself argued against transcendental subjectivity, urging that the classic phenomenological “I” constituting the world that first constituted it, is a residue of Cartesianism. It is thus never alone and must first be grasped existentially (PP: 365).

17. Husserl, PCIT, §36 “The Time-Constituting Flow as Absolute Subjectivity”, 79.

18. Heidegger is loath to use the term “transcendence”, given its metaphysical resonance. However, given that the ontological difference can only be experienced if Da-sein ceases to flee from itself into a social world and thanks to the power of anguish to dissolve our connections with that world, it is possible to see in the acceptance of one’s groundlessness and mortality a kind of transcendence that enables Da-sein to get itself into view as a whole. This is the only way, indeed, that our temporal dispersion can be consolidated and the question of authenticity (ownmost-ness, Eigent-lichkeit) correctly posed.

The “problem of transcendence” cannot be brought round to the question of how a subject comes out to an Object… Rather we must ask: what makes it ontologically possible for entities to be encountered within-the-world and Objectified as so encountered? This can be answered by recourse to the transcendence of the world—a transcendence with an extatico-horizonal foundation [in Dasein]. (BT §69c)

19. Levinas discusses the trace of responsibility explicitly in OBBE 46–47, 157–160; in TI it is implicit.

20. This is discussed in OBBE 45, 70, 160. Cf. Merleau-Ponty 1964 [1968: 167]. Also see PP 361, 364.

21. For a comprehensive discussion of Levinas’ criticisms of Heidegger, see Cohen-Levinas and Schnell (eds) 2021.

22. See Laurent Villevieille’s detailed study on the déformalisation (2021). Villevieille explains that

by delimiting the pure sphere of logic [Husserlian phenomenology] simultaneously defines the domain of philosophy… [as] transregional. (p. 181)

In so doing, Husserl nevertheless commits the error of neglecting the problem posed by the one who formalizes, that is, he who performs the formalization and who, not accidently but constitutively, tends unconsciously to compromise the transregional character [to which he aspired] (p. 179). Thus, “to philosophize is, in effect, inseparably to make a formalizing departure and a deformalizing return. In other words, it is first to retain, of the phenomena, their sole form, and then to refer this form to that of which it is the form; thus to return to the phenomenon from which the form had been extracted” (p. 174). When Levinas ‘deformalizes’ Heidegger, he is following the same method of attending to the existential and material conditions of a ‘subject’ or of Heidegger’s Da-sein.

23. Lapidot (2021) urges that with a meta-politics grounded on the family, Levinas both borrows from and criticizes Heidegger’s community of the people [Volk] as discussed in § 74 of Being and Time.

24. Philosophically, mediations may serve various Platonic and Neo-Platonic logics of “emanation”, which absorb multiplicity and difference. See Wolosky 2017.

25. Levinas, “The State of Israel and the Religion of Israel”, in DF 216, translation modified for fidelity to the original.

26. Brezis (2012) has explored Levinas’ use of Christian tropes in Otherwise than Being.

27. See Husserl’s notes on intersubjectivity from 10 January 1927, Husserliana 14, 404 wherein he claims that life as praxis requires no phenomenological reduction.

28. Sebbah continues:

on initial time whereby [our authentic relation to others] is no longer established in the relationship to the living and vulnerable face, and a second time in attempting to preserve [these lifeless traces] in the world, and more radically in being, which requires, on the contrary, the opening beyond being, the breakthrough beyond all memories understood as things or as representations, toward an Immemorial that will never be caught within presence. (Sebbah 2018a, 6; trans. by author)

Significant here is the sheer extent of Levinas’ ‘Maimonidean’ opposition to ontology, understood as an encompassing, closed system. Like the enigmatic attributes of practice in Maimonides, the immediacy of living experience, living intersubjectivity, is sui generis, an ‘economy’ both within and separated from what-is.

29. See Husserl APS 1966 [2001: 201 and “Appendix 19” 512–519]. Levinas writes

Will it be said that the world weighs with all its suffering…on the ego because this ego is a free consciousness capable of sympathy and compassion?… Let us admit for a moment a free ego, capable of deciding for solidarity with others. At least it will be recognized that this freedom has no time to assume this urgent weight, and that consequently it is as checked or undone under the suffering. (OBBE 128)

30. Also see the seminar Heidegger gave in 1927, intended to be the completion of Being and Time, in Heidegger 1927 [1982: §§19–21].

31. See Franz Rosenzweig, The Star of Redemption (SE 1921), Part Two “Revelation or the Ever-Renewed Birth of the Soul”, Book Three “Redemption or the Eternal Future of the Kingdom”, sections “Root-Sentence” and “Choral Form”. In Rosenzweig, the root-words build the root-sentence “love thy neighbor”. They forge the dialogue—even the song that unites the community—through the form of this sentence, which, whatever its additional content is the Good, is thanks, is invitation. Levinas introduces this between two persons as the Dire, or the Saying. I thank Jacob Courchesne (Université de Montréal) for this insight.

32. At the root of what the Greeks called the logos, Heidegger invites us to grasp the essence of this as that, as “formal indication” pointing toward the making-manifest that is beyond the realm of things “present at hand”. See Heidegger 1929–1930 [1995: §§69–72].

33. Husserl, PCIT, No. 54, 379–394; Also see Husserl 1973c [notes on intersubjectivity 1929–1935], 398.

34. For a dissenting argument that sets the question of justice, and with it, language, as prior to any “deep saying”, see Franck 2008: 241–245.

35. What Husserl calls the “reduction within the reduction”, see Husserl 1973a (notes on intersubjectivity 1905–1920), No. 5, 77–90.

36. Levinas does not propose a solution to the epistemic conundrum of how non-objective memories can be translated into objects for philosophical reflection. Instead, he assimilates the “ethical” impetus underlying skepticism with his own deconstruction of dialogue: “are we not at this very moment in the process of barring the exit that our whole essay attempts” (OBBE 169)? This flows from a discussion that is not so unlike Husserl’s 1920s speculation on “proto-intentionality [Urintentionalität]”.

37. Husserl, E Manuscript III 9/5a, cited in GDP lixff.

38. The paradox is that tiny modifications of sensibility or sense contents contribute to the ‘flow’ of consciousness temporalizing. However they can themselves only become intentional objects once they are integrated into the flow, or intentionalized. This makes them already retentions when we turn our attention to them, even though in their upsurge, they would be so bodily as to be pre-intentional. Nevertheless, formally, this pre-intentionality is important to the very possibility of the movement of consciousness as flux.

39. Other influences abound in this work, from his Strasbourg professor of psychology, Maurice Pradines, to Henri Bergson’s descriptions of “duration”, to Merleau-Ponty’s “intertwining” of layered sensibility.

40. The idea of language as a signifying system, invariably pointing beyond its components (words) is already present in Levinas’ 1962 talk at the Collège de philosophie. Therein, he argues that

language would not be a set of nouns designating the essence of things, acts, and relations, nor even knots of relations expressed in a symbol…language is the fact that what is thought, this core aimed at, signifies, that is, is already surpassed in its fixity, is [already] qua something else.

See “Notice sur la métaphore” in eds. Rudolphe Calin and Catherine Chalier, Emmanuel Levinas: Parole et silence et autres conférences inédites au Collège Philosophique (LO2), 321–347, here 337, trans. by author.

41. In Being and Time, Heidegger reconceived the famous “hermeneutic circle”, starting from Da-sein, the being for whom its existence (or Being) is a question. Given the interrogative relationship of Da-sein to its being is hermeneutical, Heidegger is not working within traditional hermeneutics understood as a textual method. In this sense beyond Schleiermacher, Dilthey, and Bultmann whom he inspired, Heidegger unfolded a hermeneia in which the meaning intended is that of the being that we are, before any interpretation of texts. As Jean-Luc Nancy put it, Heidegger’s practice deformalized classical hermeneutics by locating meaning in our lived, pre-understanding of our own situation. See Heidegger, BT §9, and Nancy 1982: 18–23 (my trans.).

42. What Talmud scholar Ouaknin calls the excess of the being-able-to-say (pouvoir-dire) over a text’s intending-to-say (vouloir-dire). This is what makes a book into a Book. See Ouaknin 1993: 225 [1995: 155–156]. Ouaknin repeatedly cites Levinas BTV 111.

43. Both Fagenblat and Kavka agree that “it is not clear…that…a ‘new direction’ in Jewish philosophy is really new”. See Kavka 2010: 21. While Kavka traces Levinas’ navigation between two major figures in medieval Jewish philosophy, Yehuda Halevi and Moses Maimonides, Fagenblat emphasizes the centrality of Maimonides, notably around the debate about “creation”—a concept whose contemporary sense is the establishment of (ethical) order and deployment of a world (2010: 60). For Kavka, the figures of Halevi and Maimonides provide a metaphoric geography between what might be called the moral intuitionism of the first and the ethical rationalism of the second. In both cases, Levinas focuses attention on the creation of meaning understood first as responsibility and hospitality in TI (1961), then as bearing witness or secularized prophecy in OBBE (1974).

44. In order of publication, Gibbs 1992; Cohen 1994; Cohen (ed.) 2009; Nordmann 2017.

45. For an expanded discussion of this, see Banon 2022.

46. Ouaknin (1993 [1995]) cites Levinas, “On the Jewish Reading of Scriptures” in BTV 109.

47. Fagenblat is citing Maimonides’ translator and commentator, Shlomo Pines, who reminds us that at the end of the Guide of the Perplexed, a striking reversal occurs in Maimonides’ metaphysics—toward the practical. If we can only know “attributes of action”, then in a complex sense, the bios praktikos thus proves higher than the bios theoretikos. One might say that one does not know but enacts “God”.

48. See Critchley 2015: 272. Theodor de Boer has argued that Otherwise than Being demonstrates the priority of metaphysics to ontology more profoundly than did Totality and Infinity. Franck finds in Otherwise than Being a problematic deepening of the relationship between radical transcendence and justice. Bernet urges that Otherwise than Being carries Levinas’ engagement with the hermeneutics of sensibility and therewith, the critique of phenomenological account of time to its fullest expression. See respectively: de Boer 1997: 62–64; Franck 2008: 233–245; Bernet 2002: 92–93.

49. See Levinas, “La métaphore” in LO2: 323–347.

50. Two years prior to the publication of Totality and Infinity, Levinas’ 1959 talk, “Au-delà du possible,” explored the theme of the other as hostile, as enemy, or as a source of violence (LO2, 305-306). It shows that he was aware of alterity as a source of struggle.

51. For a useful debate over Levinas’ attitude toward politics, notably the politics of repression, see Caygill 2002, esp. 188–195, and Morgan 2016, esp. 315–323.

52. Also see Fagenblat 2015, 297–320. Fagenblat points out that in his “Être juif” (1947), Levinas argues that being Jewish “provides…phenomenological access…to the total passivity of the human condition” (2015, 301), Levinas, LO1 172.

53. Hermann Cohen (1915) put it succinctly: While the emergence of ideas, that is, humans’ emancipation from the purely empirical realm, begins as ethical thought, “[w]e find again the same orientation of the primary force of thought” in “the abandonment of perception and its object constituted by empirical man: for the prophet, this [abandonment] is the ascent toward humanity [Jerusalem]; for the Greek, this abandonment amounts to the passage toward the state” (35, trans. by author).

54. Levinas recounts being questioned by Latin American clerics about the empirical evidence of the Same concerned by the Other to the point of feeling divided in itself. Levinas provides ‘evidence’: “at least here…in this group of students…who nevertheless had no other subjects of conversation than the crisis” in Latin America. See OGCM 81.

55. Frost contrasts Agamben and Levinas’ approach to ethics, whereby Agamben criticizes transcendence or the Good in Levinas as an unnecessary seduction taken up by philosophers (also see Bloechl 2022, “Conclusion”). Further, Agamben claims to conceive responsibility out of the Latin spondeo or “to become the guarantor of something for someone”. From there, he argues that responsibility ties human relations to law, understood in a juridical sense, but not to justice. However, Agamben is carrying a French word back to the wrong symbolic system (Roman law), forgetting that for Levinas, responsibility remains pre-reflective and tied to a commandment, not a law. For the profound difference between commandment and law, see Rosenzweig The Star of Redemption Part two “The Course”, Book Two “Revelation” section “The Commandment” (Rosenzweig SE 1921 [1971: 176–177]). (Thanks to Jacob Courchesne (Université de Montréal) for this insight.)

56. Compare Levinas’ remark with the observation from Bereshit Rabba 49:20. “If it is a world you want, then strict justice is impossible. And if it is strict justice you want, then a world is impossible,” cited by Liska 2017, 54. (Thanks to Marc Zilbert for noting this.)