Emmanuel Levinas

First published Sun Jul 23, 2006; substantive revision Mon Sep 29, 2025

Emmanuel Levinas’ (1905–1995) intellectual project was to develop a first philosophy. Whereas traditionally first philosophy denoted either metaphysics or theology, only to be reconceived by Heidegger as fundamental ontology, Levinas argued that it is ethics that should be so conceived. But, rather than formulating an ethical theory, Levinas developed his philosophy in opposition to both metaphysics and ontology. It takes the form of a description and interpretation of the event of encountering another person.[1] Giving rise to spontaneous acts of responsibility for others, the encounter unfolds, according to Levinas, at a precognitive level, thanks to what he called our embodied “sensibility”.[2] That is why a phenomenology of intersubjective responsibility would be ‘first’ philosophy; viz., in the sense of interpretively reconstructing a level of experience precursive to both reflective activity and practical interests.

Some commentators have called Levinas’ work an ethics of ethics, others a meta-ethics, while still others have urged that his thought can accommodate many ethical theories, from intuitionism to rationalism (see infra). However that may be, his work is in ongoing, critical dialogue with three philosophers: Husserl, Heidegger, and Hegel. Given these targets—as well as philosophical interlocutors like Merleau-Ponty—Levinas’ philosophy begins from an enlarged conception of lived embodiment and a powerful extension of Husserl’s technique of suspending conceptualization to reveal experience as it comes to light. He is also indebted to Heidegger for his hermeneutics of being-in-the-world.

1. Life and Career

1905:
Born January 12 in Kaunas, Lithuania. The latter is a part of pre-Revolutionary Russia and the surrounding culture “tolerates” Jews. He is the eldest child in a middle-class family and has two brothers, Boris and Aminadab.
1914:
In the wake of the War, Levinas’ family emigrates to Kharkov, in the Ukraine. The family returns to Lithuania in 1920, two years after the country obtains independence from the Revolutionary government.
1923:
Goes to study philosophy in Strasbourg (France). Levinas studies philosophy with Maurice Pradines, psychology with Charles Blondel, and sociology with Maurice Halbwachs. Meets Maurice Blanchot who will become a close friend.
1928–29:
Levinas travels to Freiburg to study with Edmund Husserl; he attends Heidegger’s seminar.
1930:
Publishes his thesis in French, La théorie de l’intuition dans la phénoménologie de Husserl [The Theory of Intuition in Husserl’s Phenomenology].
1931:
French translation, by Levinas, of Husserl’s Sorbonne lectures, Cartesian Meditations, in collaboration with Gabrielle Peiffer.
1932:
Returns to Lithuania in order to marry Raïssa Levi, whom he has known since childhood.
1934:
Levinas publishes a philosophical analysis of “Hitlerism”, Quelques réflexions sur la philosophie de l’hitlérisme [Reflections on the Philosophy of Hitlerism, RPH].
1935:
Levinas publishes an original essay in hermeneutic ontology, De l’évasion [On Escape], in Émile Bréhier’s journal Recherches philosophiques (reprinted in 1982). He also publishes “L’actualité de Maïmonide” in the journal of the Alliance Israëlite Universelle, Paix et Droit, commemorating the eight hundredth anniversary of the philosopher’s birth.
1939:
Naturalized French; enlists in the French officer corps.
1940:
Captured by the Nazis; imprisoned in Fallingbostel, a labor camp for officers. His Lithuanian family is murdered. His wife, Raïssa, and daughter, Simone, are hidden by nuns in Orléans.
1947:
Following the publication of De l’existence à l’existant [Existence and Existents] (which Levinas began writing in captivity), Le temps et l’autre [Time and the Other], four lectures given at the Collège Philosophique (founded by Jean Wahl), Levinas becomes Director of the École Normale Israélite Orientale, Paris.
1949:
After the death of their second daughter, Andrée Éliane, Levinas and his wife have a son, Michael, who becomes a pianist and a composer.
Levinas publishes En découvrant l’existence avec Husserl et Heidegger (selections appear in Discovering Existence with Husserl, 1998).
1957:
He delivers his first Talmudic reading at the Colloque des Intellectuels Juifs de Langue française, a colloquium attended by Vladimir Jankélévitch, André Neher, and Jean Halperin, among others.
1961:
Publishes his State doctorate (Doctorat d’État), Totalité et infini: essai sur l’extériorité [Totality and Infinity: An Essay on Exteriority. Position at the Université de Poitiers.
1963:
Publishes Difficile liberté: essais sur le judaïsme [Difficult Freedom: Essays on Judaism].
1967:
Professor at the Université de Paris, Nanterre, with Paul Ricœur.
1968:
Publishes Quatre lectures talmudiques (English translation in Nine Talmudic Readings).
1972:
L’humanisme de l’autre homme [Humanism of the Other].
1973:
Professorship at the Université de Paris IV-Sorbonne. The 1973–1974 lectures will be published as Dieu, la mort et le temps [God, Death and Time].
1974:
Autrement qu’être ou au-delà de l’essence [Otherwise than Being or Beyond Essence], the second magnum opus.
1975:
Sur Maurice Blanchot (English translation appended to Proper Names).
1976:
Noms propres [Proper Names].
1977:
Du sacré au saint (English translation in Nine Talmudic Readings).
1982:
De Dieu qui vient à l’idée [Of God Who Comes to Mind], L’au-delà du verset [Beyond the Verse] and his radio conversations with Philippe Nemo, Éthique et infini [Ethics and Infinity].
1984:
Transcendance et Intelligibilité [Transcendence and Intelligibility] (English translation in Emmanuel Levinas: Basic Philosophical Writings)
Éthique comme philosophie première [Ethics as first philosophy]
1987:
Hors sujet [Outside the Subject], a collection of texts, old and new on philosophers, language, and politics.
1988:
À l’heure des nations [In the Time of the Nations].
1990:
De l’oblitération: Entretien avec Françoise Armengaud [On Obliteration: An Interview with Françoise Armengaud Concerning the Work of Sasha Sosno].
1991:
Entre Nous: Essais sur le penser-à-l’autre [Entre Nous: Essays on Thinking-of-the-Other]. An issue of the prestigious Les Cahiers de L’Herne is dedicated to Levinas’ work.
1993:
Sorbonne lectures, published as Dieu, la mort et le temps [God, Death and Time]. The annual colloquium at Cerisy-la-Salle publishes a volume devoted to him.
1994:
His wife Raïssa Levinas dies in September. Levinas publishes a collection of essays, Liberté et commandement (two essays, “Freedom and Command” and “Transcendence and Height”, published respectively in Collected Philosophical Papers and Basic Philosophical Writings) and Les imprévus de l’histoire [Unforeseen History], edited by Pierre Hayat.
1995:
Altérité et transcendance [Alterity and Transcendence].
Emmanuel Levinas dies in Paris, December 25.

Books published posthumously:

1996:
Nouvelles lectures talmudiques [New Talmudic Readings].
1998:
Éthique comme philosophie première [Ethics as First Philosophy; first published as an article in 1984]

2. Thematic Exposition of Levinas’ Philosophy

This entry will follow Levinas’ career chronologically, as his concepts evolve. In what follows, we will emphasize the following arguments and themes: (1) why Levinas’ is a unique first philosophy; (2) how he developed his investigation of the lived conditions of possibility of our concern with ethical reasoning; and (3) the originality of his adaptation of phenomenology and his existentialist hermeneutics of pre-intentional embodied intersubjectivity. A leitmotif of this entry is the notion of transcendence, in Levinas, as we will explain. We will pay attention throughout to the contribution of commentators, with a view to providing a gateway to recent secondary literature.

2.1 Philosophical Beginnings: On Escape (1935) or Transcendence as the Need to Escape

Levinas published his thesis, The Theory of Intuition in Husserl’s Phenomenology, in 1930. It was the first book-length introduction to Edmund Husserl’s thought in French. By focusing on the theme of intuition, Levinas established what philosophical readers find notably in Husserl’s Ideas I and II/III (published in 1913 and, for Ideas II/III, partially in 1930, and in different editions in 1952 and 2025): every human experience is open to phenomenological description; every human experience carries meaning from the outset and can be examined as a mode of intentionality (Ideas II, §56 h and §§57–61). The following year, he published his co-translation of Husserl’s Cartesian Meditations, in which Husserl had laid out a systematic presentation of transcendental phenomenology. In the 1930s, Levinas continued to publish studies of the thought of his two principal teachers, Husserl and Martin Heidegger. These included the essays “Martin Heidegger and Ontology” (1932, EDE 53–76) and the extensive “The Work of Edmund Husserl” (1940, DEH 47–89). In the 1930s and 1940s, his philosophical project was influenced by Husserl’s phenomenological method, whose foundation arguably lay in the centrality of the “transcendental ego” (Ideas I §49). However, suspicious of the intellectualism of Husserl’s approach to essences (called phenomenological “eidetics”), Levinas gravitated toward Heidegger’s more worldly approach to existence in Being and Time.[3] Between 1930 and 1935, he will nevertheless turn away from Heidegger’s approach to being and transcendence, and develop the outlines of a distinct ontology. As we shall see, he will reconceive transcendence as a need for escape from existence, and work out a different analysis of lived time in On Escape (1935).

Levinas’ first original essay, De l’évasion, examined the relationship between the embodied (sentient) self and the intentional ego[4] from the perspectives of physical and affective states including need, pleasure, shame, and nausea. In this succinct philosophical work, Levinas was less concerned than was Heidegger with the question of existence as it opens up before us when we experience the dissolving of things in the world in anxiety (BT §40).[5] Levinas’ question was not: “Why is there being instead of simply nothing?” His concern was to approach existence differently, through the human being as Heidegger had also done, but in light of more embodied experiences like the above-mentioned ones (OE §6). Enlarging Heidegger’s hermeneutics of being-in-the-world, Levinas gave priority to lived moods and physical states that revealed existence as oppressive and indeterminate. Indeed, in escapism and its various aesthetic expressions, we discover humans’ failed attempts to get away from the being that they themselves are. “Escape”, he wrote,

is the need to get out of oneself, that is, to break that most radical and unalterably binding of chains, the fact that the I [moi] is oneself [soi-même]. (OE §1)

In the two imbricated dimensions of human life, sentient-affective and intentional, our experience of being comes to pass in the relationship between body and egoic consciousness.

Levinas’ youthful project approached transcendence secularly, in light of humans’ irreducible urge to get past the limits of their physical and social circumstances. His transcendence is less a question of cognition reaching reality or humans seeking to pass ‘beyond’ themselves (respectively BT §§43, 10) than transcendence, attempted through sensuous evasions. This approach to transcendence is nevertheless motivated by the question of our mortality and finite being, but unlike Heidegger, it also examines the enigma called infinity.

Levinas thus accepted Heidegger’s arguments that a human being experiences itself as if thrown into its world (BT §38), without cognitive mastery over its birth and death. Heidegger’s human being, or Da-sein (being-there), lives out its time projecting itself toward its diverse possibilities. It flees its uncanny thrownness by distracting itself in social pursuits, a position that Levinas will not adopt. On the other hand, the projective element of transcendence, which Heidegger described in The Basic Problems of Phenomenology (1927 [1982])[6] as merely a “stepping over to…as such”, was of great interest to Levinas. But he would enquire: to what and from what are we ‘stepping over’? Levinas then observed:

[M]odern sensibility wrestles with problems that indicate…the abandonment of this concern with transcendence. As if it had the certainty that the idea of the limit could not apply to the existence of what is…and as if modern sensibility perceived in being a defect still more profound. (OE §1, emph. added)

His argument here concerns a conceit of our ‘modern’ sensibility (and philosophy); namely, that we presume we could thoughtfully frame a better conception of being, wherein existence was in some sense self-sufficient. What Levinas calls the “insufficiency of the human condition” (OE §1) simply denotes the limitation of our existence, whose transcendence, when understood as escape, promises that we might somehow surpass it, as if through an infinite experience. When transcendence is removed from theological or metaphysical frameworks (i.e., secularized as Heidegger’s “stepping over”), then we grasp it in its historical context-dependency, as the illusions of a finite being pondering pure self-sufficiency. Reconceived in this way, the entire question of transcendence changes, revealing the struggle to get out of our all too finite existence. That is why Levinas asks: “[Is] the need for escape not the exclusive matter of a finite being?…Would an infinite being have the need to take leave of itself” (OE §2)? In short, is our first response to mortality not the urge to take leave of our existence, if periodically? This question is not so different from Heidegger’s conception of inauthenticity. But unlike Heidegger, true authenticity does not lie in securing our freedom for our most personal possibility, death. Levinas argued that we can approach death as possibility only through that of others and that we grasp being as finite by way of their mortality. On the other hand, when secularized, the idea of infinity refers to something absolute in human consciousness (OE §1), which motivates our repeated efforts at escaping ourselves into various ecstasies. This is clearly a conception of being that is different from Heidegger’s. Later, of course, Levinas will attribute infinity to a different experience, that of the unbounded quality of the face of the other. However, intersubjective relationality is little discussed in the 1935 essay. The encounter with the other first comes into view as a theme in his 1940s works (TO and EE). Significant here, nevertheless, are the following two points: (1) Levinas’ argument that Heidegger’s conception of existence is specific to a history, that of German thought and that of hermeneutics; (2) to be an embodied psyche is to struggle with the limits of one’s facticity or existential situation, and it is there that the question of being as our existence initially arises.

Heidegger’s Da-sein confronted the question of being when it found itself brought before itself in anxiety (BT §40). In contrast, Levinas proposed other ways by which the gap narrows between being itself and the beings that we are. Following his leitmotif of our recurrent urge to escape, Levinas examined the invariable disappointments following our attempts at transcending our existence: the aforementioned states of need and pleasure give way to a sobering up or disillusionment. In affective and physical states like shame and nausea, the bodily self is experienced as a substance trapped in its stifling existence and desperate for a way out. Commentator Jacques Rolland has explored Levinas’ return to the body, to concreteness, to the desire for escape, and the way in which he criticized Heidegger’s hermeneutics (OE 29–32). Rolland adds that this approach was inspired by Levinas’ critical meditation, published one year earlier (1934), on the “blood and soil” philosophy popular with National Socialism (RPH). As regards stifling existence, when Levinas refers to being, it is as ongoing presence, rather than the event of disclosure that Heidegger described. It remains a matter of debate whether this interpretation of being constitutes a step back to an older metaphysics, prior to Heidegger’s innovations, or not (Franck 2008: 31).

Whether we choose to take Levinas’ approach to being as criticizing Heidegger’s conception of our existence or as inspired by him, commentators often underscore its fresh empiricism. Megan Craig compares the early works of Levinas with the “radical empiricism” of William James (2010: xv). Lisa Guenther, in turn, has examined embodiment and the experience of maternity in the later Levinas (2006: 119–136, see §3.4.5). From the outset, the “fact of existing” refers to some philosophically unexplored phenomena of our embodiment, our aforementioned I-self (moi-soi) duality.

Polemically, Levinas urged that the most extreme state he described, nausea, amounts to being-there, what Husserl’s phenomenology called “self-positing”: “…nausea posits itself not only as something absolute, but as the very act of self-positing: it is the affirmation itself of being” (OE §6). Other forms of self-positing occur, of course, as this event refers to the experience of unity between the lived corporeal self and the formal ego of intentions. In a somewhat different vein, Raoul Moati will speak of the “first-” and the “third-person” perspectives (2012 [2017: 38–71]). Thus, in immediate experience, I am my joy or my pain, provisionally, just as I may observe myself joyful, like a third person. Nevertheless, our various efforts to get out of our concrete situations are not the same as what Heidegger deemed projections toward new possibilities, wherein our death lies at the end of all the others, as the ultimate limit, or “possibility of impossibility” (BT §50). For Levinas, by contrast, escape represents a positive, dynamic need. In this youthful work, he also rethinks need as fullness rather than as mere privation. As we indicated, he is working toward a different understanding of existence itself. Whether it is characterized by pleasure or suffering, need is the very ground of that existence. A secular transcendence responds to need, promising a path toward “something other than ourselves” (OE §3), which is why the deep motivation of need is to get out of our finite condition. Already by 1935, Levinas’ ontology has displaced Heidegger’s being in light of the dynamic relation between the sentient self and the intentional ‘I’; it has refocused attention on the present over Heidegger’s emphasis on the future and explored new modes by which we experience the being that we are.

In this youthful essay, Levinas discusses three important themes critical for Heidegger: If being is disclosed only through the being that we are as humans (Da-sein), then any human being that ongoingly strives to escape itself, because it feels trapped in its own daily life, can be called a “creature” that carries “the stigmatum of [finite] existence” (OE §8). Second, nausea is not simply a physiological scourge, according to Levinas. It shows us dramatically how being can encircle us on all sides, to the point of submerging us. Social and political life, themselves, may thereby nauseate us, as Rolland observes. Third, if being or existence is experienced in its pure form as heavy indeterminacy, then we can neither bypass it (as expressed in the “aspirations of Idealism” [OE §8]) nor merely accepted like passive subjects. Being is existence, but it is firstly our existence. The mark of creaturely existence is need and, by extension, a struggle with being. The crucial question that remains is how we can best think through our sensuous need to transcend being. Embodied need is not an illusion, as we have seen. Is transcendence an illusion? Levinas answers this question more fully in Totality and Infinity (1961).

2.2 Middle Writings: Existence and Existents (1947) and Time and the Other (1947) or Inflections of Transcendence and Variations on Being

The 1940s writings extend Levinas’ innovations in ontology, always with recourse to interpretations of embodiment and against Heidegger’s philosophy of existence which, for Levinas, entails engagement with being as “participation” without alterity.[7] These writings inflect his notion of transcendence, away from the imagined transcendence of evasion and pleasure, toward eros and the promise of the birth of a child.[8] This requires that he explore alterity, understood here as the feminine other (EE 86).

In Existence and Existents (1947) and Time and the Other (1947), being now has a dual aspect, of light and of dark indeterminacy. It is as though being were divided between the being of a created world and the darkness out of which light was brought.[9] This shifts phenomenological focus onto being as light and visibility, wherein we constitute objects, and being as the dark turmoil that we experience in insomnia. Levinas’ attempt to expand the sense of the embodied Da-sein, and to reconceive the distinction between being and Da-sein (existence and the perceptual open that we are) has also changed. Following Husserl’s transcendental phenomenology, in which a multi-layered “I” directs intentional focus like a center from which our attention radiates, Levinas’ embodied ego is neither preceded nor outstripped by its world. The corporeal self [soi], henceforth called the “hypostasis”, is its own ground; i.e., we awaken out of ourselves, into light; we proceed with our projects (EE 61–86; TO 51–55). We fall asleep, curled about ourselves, thereby exiting our conscious existence. Embodied consciousness thus begins and ends with itself. As such, it is both dependent on and independent from its environment, and Levinas will urge that the subject, upon awakening, uses and masters being.

In the middle period essays, the partial transcendences of pleasure and desire, already sketched in 1935, receive fuller development and variations. The meaning of transcendence focuses on a new temporality promised by desire and “fecundity”, or the birth of the son (EE 100; TO 91–92). The son incarnates alterity in a curious way. He is, in a sense, his father and not his father. However, his birth opens a different focus on the future. No longer conceived as one of open possibilities, as Heidegger had argued, the time opened by the son responds to two basic limitations on our understanding and representation: death and the other person. While not denying Heidegger’s intuition about death as the “possibility of impossibility”, Levinas repeats his earlier argument that we witness death only in the death of the other. But even as such, it escapes everyday understanding. Hence, Levinas will qualify death as an alterity as radical as that of the other human being who confronts me.

In death the existing of the existent is alienated. To be sure, the other that is announced does not possess this existing as the subject possesses it; its hold over my existing is mysterious. It is not unknown but unknowable. (TO 75)

Of course, we can and do constitute the other as an alter ego. Yet such constitution by phenomenological apperception never exhausts his fundamental difference (TO 78–79). In so arguing, Levinas proposes to enlarge Husserl’s “other”, of whom the latter said that he or she is “an analogon of myself, [yet also] not an analogon in the habitual sense” (CM §44).

Two reversals should be noted, here, relative to 1935. First, against Hegel’s conception of work as the dialectic of spirit transforming nature, Levinas describes labor phenomenologically as effort and fatigue,[10] again highlighting his distinction between the embodied, working self and the cognitive ego. The second reversal concerns moods themselves. In Heidegger, anxiety, joy, and boredom were states of mind, with anxiety as the privileged mood by which humans are confronted with themselves, their lack of ground, and with the question of their existence. In his middle period, Levinas will expand the experience of being to moods now including horror. Nighttime being reveals an indeterminate dark presence that is not pure nothing. “The horror of the night, as an experience of the there-is, does not then reveal to us a danger of death, nor even a danger of pain” (EE 57). Therefore pure being can never be just Heidegger’s lighted clearing. And our existence in the world requires stronger embodiment than an eye and a hand that reaches to grasp objects “ready-to-hand” (Heidegger). Once again, Levinas recurs to bodily states, this time including fatigue, indolence, insomnia, and awakening. In the first three, the aforementioned gap between the embodied self and the intentional I increases. Upon awakening, the embodied ego (soi-moi) reasserts its mastery over things and even its own bodily torpor. But for Levinas being in the world is less a matter of utility and Heidegger’s phenomenon of “falling” into distraction, than one of love of life and sheer enjoyment (BT 179).[11] This, too, is part of Levinas’ critique of Heidegger, for whom our concern for the world often coexists with instrumentalist relationships with things. In search of variations on being as a call or as revelation, and in privileging the basic subjectivity (or “hypostasis”) capable of raising itself above being (now understood as the neutral “there is”), Levinas is en route to his secular philosophy of alterity and transcendence. For further discussion of the middle works, see Supplement S.1 on Transcendence and Being.

2.3 The “Treatise on Hospitality”: Totality and Infinity (1961) or Responsibility, Transcendence, and Justice

Totality and Infinity was written as Levinas’ Doctorat d’État.[12] His concept of transcendence provides us a useful point of departure for reading Totality and Infinity. That is, so long as we consider his debt to Husserl’s phenomenology. Husserl understood transcendence in several ways, of which one dimension was that typical of consciousness extending toward and encountering the worldly objects (noema) that offer themselves to it. After Husserl, Heidegger will define transcendence as the essence of our existing in the world. Da-sein is always already in the world among things, according to a worldly transcendence or being out-there. Jean-Paul Sartre followed Heidegger in this, urging that “transcendence is a constitutive structure of consciousness” (EN 1943 [1992: 23]), and his concept of consciousness is similarly in the world and ingredient in our actions.

For Levinas, these senses of transcendence are acceptable but not primary. Instead, he aligns transcendence with exteriority, in the sense of what lies outside myself but eludes my comprehensive knowledge: the other person (TI 49).[13] The encounter with the other is an encounter with a visible thing, of course. But this other speaks to me, implores or commands me. In responding, I discover my responsibility to them. This is the ground of ethics or indeed our concern with ethics as the good of the other person.

As Levinas argues, when ethics goes in search of its existential ground, before any consideration of utility, virtue, or duty, it discovers the relational enactment of responsibility, which resists being integrated into accounts in which the other is a universal other to whom it is my duty, for example, to act ethically, or in the hope of increasing the happiness of the collectivity (Kant). To be sure, utility, virtue, and duty are crucial to ethical debates. Yet Levinas is pointing to their common lived origin in the irreducibility of the face-to-face encounter. For a further discussion, see Supplement S.2 on Levinas and Contemporary Ethics.

2.3.1 Structure of the Work

Totality and Infinity unfolds around phenomenological descriptions of being, depicted initially as nature or forces in conflict (TI 21–22). However, our being in-the-world also entails the enjoyment of natural elements and love of life (TI 110–115).

We live from ‘good soup’, air, light, spectacles, work, ideas, sleep, etc….These are not objects of representations. We live from them. (TI 110)

Levinas also reframes labor as the creation of a store of goods thanks to which the other can be welcomed (TI 157–161, 205), rather than solely as the mastery or humanization of nature. Because we take joy in living and in creating a home, our existence in the world entails dimensions other than Heidegger’s “thrown potentiality-for-Being-in-the-world”, which is based on Da-sein’s being abandoned to itself (BT 236). Consequently, our lives do not consist in an isolated facticity, as Heidegger had ventured.

Life is not the naked will to be, an ontological Sorge [care] for this life. Life’s relation with the very conditions of its life becomes the nourishment and content of that life. (TI 112)

In being thus nourished, we can receive the other into our space.

On the basis of these descriptions, transcendence as defined above comes to pass in several stages. First, the onset of the other—as the expression of the face—interrupts our free activity (and willing) and calls us to account for ourselves (TI 198, 291), something Levinas calls “goodness” (TI 200).[14] Second, in responding, the subject approached by the other engages in an act that opens the possibility of dialogue. The unfolding of dialogue expands the social relationship, and Levinas argues that social life preserves a residue of the initial “ethical” encounter with the face. Intersubjective dialogue entails conversation, teaching, and at a more general level, literary or philosophical speech (TI 51, 57, 251–52, 295). As we will see, this is a dimension of human sociality that often goes unexplored in phenomenologies of intersubjectivity.

Over the course of the expansion of dialogue, the trace of responsibility is attenuated, and conundrums arise concerning the well-being of others and conflicts within the community. These require deliberation about justice and fairness. For instance: what does justice for the other(s) mean? Should it above all concern the reparation of wrongs? Can responsibility for an other coexist with disinterested equity within the community? Or is justice in service to the stronger and ultimately opposed to responsibility? Now, because it can clearly be interpreted as all of these things, justice sometimes appears as intermediary between Levinas’ aforementioned ontology of worldly forces in conflict (or elementary being) and our acts of responsibility. This would tally with Aristotle’s two conceptions of justice, first as political and second, as unbidden ‘decency’, tò epiekes, meaning to accept receiving less than one’s share. Aristotle himself defined the combination of the two as complete virtue (Nicomachean Ethics 1130a, 119 and 1137b7–11).[15] There would thus be an interesting precedent to Levinas’ question of the relationship between responsibility and justice in Aristotle’s virtue ethics.

Levinas’ argument in Totality and Infinity unfolds up to the question of justice and then takes an unanticipated tack. Rather than pursuing justice as it is refined through civil society into the State, Levinas focuses on a smaller-scale institution,: the family, which is arguably common to all humanity. It is presumably in the family rather than in the State that the responsibility described in the face-to-face encounter is most clearly enacted. If the family is consolidated by the birth of the child, then, as Levinas puts it, it is the father who elects and calls the child to responsibility, just as the child grows up serving his siblings in a way more personal than that prescribed by the impersonal justice of States. According to Levinas, this familial justice carries a specific temporal modalization: “The unique child, as elected one, is accordingly at the same time unique and non-unique. Paternity is produced as an innumerable future”, as open posterity (TI 279). In this penultimate section entitled “Beyond the Face”, the phenomenology of the family thus expands the responsibility experienced in the face-to-face into a micro-society, in which questions of justice may arise, but with a new emphasis on future time.[16]

2.3.2 Time, Transcendence, and Sociality

Totality and Infinity does not devote attention to clock time or to the time of universal history, in Hegel’s sense notably. Because Levinas begins his analyses with the concept of being as virtually aligned with material causality and strife, the experience of ‘subjective’ time as the interruption that occurs in the encounter with the face is not yet social time. History, too, seems to be a metaphysician’s history. In his “Preface”, Levinas describes history as violence, punctuated by extremes of war and temporary peace (TI 21–23). Morgan has argued that this makes Levinas’ approach to ethical intersubjectivity anti-naturalistic, at least to the degree that naturalism is tied to a Hobbesian mechanistic ontology (2011: 246). Levinas would be the last, however, to deny the self-interest of our drives and instincts. To the contrary, only an intersubjectivity inaugurated by the other’s summons interrupts these behaviors (Morgan 2011: 246). Yet Levinas also envisions an alternative history in which it is possible to bear witness to wrongs undergone by persons. These wrongs may not be recorded in the official history of governments. But their attestation prolongs his discussion of human sensibility as invested by responsibility. Levinas writes, “[h]istory is worked over by the ruptures of history, in which a judgment is borne upon it. When man truly approaches the Other he is uprooted from history” (TI 52).

Levinas’ phenomenological account of time contains three levels: an initial one equivalent to formal historicist time, a second level comparable to Husserl’s universal flow of immanent time-consciousness,[17] and a third temporality that is episodic and affectively colored, which he calls an interruption.

[The] discontinuity of the inner life interrupts historical time [notably in the face-to-face encounter]. The thesis of the primacy of history constitutes an option for the comprehension of being in which interiority is sacrificed. The present work proposes another option. (TI 57)

The aforementioned interruption of our immanent consciousness, qua time-flow, by the other, a rupture that Levinas says characterizes our “inner life”, is aligned with the experience of transcendence.

Unlike Heidegger, who explained the subject in terms of Da-sein—itself an ongoing transcendence toward the world in which Da-sein “comes toward itself futurally” (BT §69)[18] in facing the possibility of its death—Levinas situates his very concrete transcendence in the interruption of the first two temporal levels. Indeed, whereas Heidegger gradually translated his conception of the silent call of being (in and to Da-sein) into the notion of the event (Ereignis) in the 1930s, Levinas makes his interruption-event an intersubjective affair or rather, the basis of ethical relationality. For him, the encounter with the other is not an ontological event in Heidegger’s sense. Neither is it like an occurrence that breaks up the historical status quo, modifying the course of history into a ‘before’ and ‘after’, in function of its magnitude. Nevertheless, Levinas does argue that the encounter with alterity may leave a trace in historical time.[19] Now, because the interruption brings to light a basic personal responsibility for an other, a host of responses are possible post facto, from welcoming that other with hospitality to attempting to get him out of our way. Be that as it may, a trace of the interruption persists in the subject, like a grain of sand in an oyster or a preconscious motivation to bear witness to the other’s suffering. Jill Stauffer has recovered some of these ‘traces’ in her research on the testimonies of those deprived of human rights (2015: 40–43, 56–58, 61–64, 91 inter alia). François-David Sebbah recalls that a memorial trace persists in my experience along with the hope or dream that somewhere I will find “other people who may not hear me for the time being, but whom I might hope to rejoin”—this is his version of the ambiguity of hope in the midst of desolation (Sebbah 2018a: 29).

Flowing out of the temporal interruptions that leave affective mnemonic traces in persons, the ground of social existence in Levinas does not resemble the solipsism for which Heidegger was criticized. Our life with others is never akin to Heidegger’s “inauthenticity”, that flight from what should be the resolute assumption of our mortality, nor even to moments disappearing in a teleology of expanding socio-political collectivities that culminate in the State (Hegel; sometimes Husserl, see Husserl 1973c: no. 23, 387–395). As individuals, we are always in social relations, marked by a remainder of responsibility. We have already been impacted by the expression (or “face”) of an other.

Yet, because the immediacy of this impact resists conceptualization, we tend to overlook the force that the other’s address has on us (as facial expression or words addressed). We carry on, in our respective spheres, apparently motivated by desires and projects, some of which entail the kind of quests for mastery and recognition that Hegel described. In Totality and Infinity, nevertheless, these quests are as if undercut by “metaphysical desire” (TI 33–34, 114, 148ff.), which Levinas defines as “a desire [for the other] that cannot be satisfied”. As he explains, “we speak lightly of desires satisfied, or of sexual needs, or even of moral and religious needs” (TI 34). However, metaphysical desire “desires beyond everything that can simply complete it. It is like goodness—the Desired does not fulfill it, but deepens it” (TI 34). This under-layer of our everyday desires comes to light in the faltering of our will to mastery as experienced in the face-to-face encounter. The other’s facial expression or bodily posture affects me before I begin to reflect on it. As indicated, the impact is dual: a command and a summons. Naked and defenseless, the face signifies, with or without words, “Do not kill me”. It opposes a passive resistance to our desire for mastery wherein our freedom asserts its sovereignty (TI 84). Levinas speaks of the face of the other who is “widow, orphan, or stranger”. While these are Biblical figures, he argues that we encounter them concretely even before transcribing them into religious allegory (TI 76–78). They invest our freedom as the possibility of giving.

It is as summons and injunction that expression precipitates transcendence. If I am self-sufficient in my everyday activities and perception, then this is because I am a being that inhabits overlapping worlds in which my sway is decisive for me. The passive resistance of the face alters this sway through an affective mood not unlike one Levinas had explored in On Escape (1935): shame. In shame, we experience our freedom as unjustifiable. In thus being lifted out of its concerns, the “I” offers an account to the other, who is thereby treated as if higher than that “I”, when considered in its personal sovereignty. For that reason as well, the “I”, singled out and addressed by the other, is chosen or “elected” to respond (TI 245–246, 279). It “transascends” (TI 35, 41) or rises to the other, answering “here I am” (EI 106). As indicated, Levinas argues that this instant of “election” belongs to a temporal order different from that of everyday existence: it is the moment of enactment of a “good beyond Being” (TI 80, 102–104, 292–293).

It is impossible to set up a simple temporal order of succession or alternation between being and the good beyond being. For humans, the good comes to pass almost trivially and in everyday contexts. Of course, as readily as responsibility and generosity may be glimpsed in human affairs, cruelty and competition are also obvious. Given this, Levinas seeks support for his intuition about the good in at least two moments in the philosophical tradition, wherein its occurrence and irreducible value have been identified: Plato’s Idea of the good, and Descartes’ infinite substance, which points beyond itself to an unknowable cause. However, that humans experience moments of inexplicable generosity, even enact them spontaneously, is a fact that would remain enigmatic within an ontology of competing drives or merely utilitarian desires. In that respect, the trace of the good is present within existence as the possibility that something other than rivalries and instrumentalization take place intersubjectively.

As Levinas understands it, transcendence has the non-metaphysical characteristic of an interruption, a relation in nuce, and what he now calls “infinity”. Insofar as infinity denotes what is non-limited, uncircumscribable, it refers to the unpredictable quality of a face’s expression (TI 5). As he writes,

[t]o think the infinite, the transcendent, the Stranger, is hence not to think an object. But to think what does not have the outlines of an object is in reality to do more or better than think. (TI 49)

So far as infinity has a positive sense, then, it has that sense as our unquenchable desire for sociality. Thus, before we interpret it as “God” or reify it as a summum ens, the idea of infinity is rooted in an everyday encounter whose implications are clearest at the sensuous-affective level, and even somewhat resemble Husserl’s explorations of spontaneous empathy (Einfühlung as expanded in the 1920s notes on intersubjectivity [Husserliana, Vols. 13–15]). Rather than Husserl, however, Levinas refers to the French phenomenologist Maurice Merleau-Ponty’s conception of lived intersubjective flesh, urging that this corporeal intertwinement is part of our “fundamental historicity”,[20] that is, part of the sedimented experiences that contribute to our grasp of new situations. Sebbah also emphasizes that

the ethical imperative to respond to the command (the trial of the other person) in no way arises from a psychological process of empathy or of sympathy. (2018b, 49)

In short, in 1961, intersubjective sensibility is the locus of transcendence outside psychological considerations.

In the fourteen years separating Existence and Existents and Time and the Other from Totality and Infinity, we see both continuities and differences. If Heidegger had begun what he conceived to be a hermeneutic dismantling of Husserl’s phenomenological consciousness, seeking what “lies hidden” beneath phenomena (BT §7c), then Levinas extended this deformalizing gesture already in 1947, arguing that light itself is incipient meaning, suspending the opposition between the a priori and the a posteriori. By 1961, it is the experience of the face-to-face encounter that destabilizes the a priori-a posteriori dichotomy by urging that, in the face-to-face, the third party (humanity) looks at me through the eyes of the other. This is because the non-spatial “proximity” (approach of the other) that is the interruption of our flowing time-consciousness takes place with an unnoticed spontaneity, yet likely leaves a trace. That is, consciousness always takes up after these instants of interruption and reconnects itself as a homogeneous flow.

In Existence and Existents, Levinas voiced “the profound need to leave the climate of [Heidegger’s] philosophy” (EE 4). By 1961 he will have done so, albeit not without significantly reworking Heidegger’s fundamental ontology. As we have seen, Levinas envisions being as constant, neutral presence and, at times, like a Hobbesian state of nature. Jacques Derrida reminds us that this pre-Heideggerian conception is close to Kant’s notion of existence, understood as intensities in conflict (1997 [1999: 49, 86]). That is why, in its natural expression, being takes on almost a mechanistic quality in Levinas. In political and institutional senses, being is conceived as the encompassing of individuals and communities by the State. On the latter depend security and property, life and death. But in the “Preface” to Totality and Infinity, Levinas compares the State with systematic philosophy: as the ‘organon’ of politics, the State manages commerce and conflicts, just as it declares wars. Similarly, Hegel’s idealist dialectics oversees and integrates sensibility and cognition, progressing from the individual to the collective, and expressing the movement of Geist or Spirit (TI 21–23; 36–38; 87–88).

Overall, Levinas’ most sustained criticisms target fundamental ontology.[21] As we have seen, leaving the “atmosphere” of Heidegger’s thought motivates his return to more traditional conceptions of being. To be sure, Levinas was skeptical about deriving an ethics from ontology. Certainly, such an ethics could not limit itself to Heidegger’s Mitsein, that sociality into which Da-sein flees when troubled by its uncanny groundlessness (its being thrown into-the-world). Having attempted, from 1935 onward, to carry Heidegger’s being-there with its states of mind or moods (Befindlichkeiten), down to more embodied experiences of shame, desire, hunger, and nausea, Levinas’ conviction is that Da-sein remains too formal an entity to exist in a world in which human relationality is more substantial than a mere refuge from the anxiety of groundlessness (BT 232).[22] Although for Heidegger Angst individuates us and discloses our possibility for “the freedom of choosing…and taking hold of [ourselves]” (BT 232), this process remains solipsistic in the sense that it is our freedom and our mortality that are in question. When intensified, Angst reveals the groundlessness of our being-there, ultimately freeing us (individually) for the question: why might there ‘be’ anything at all? Against Heidegger, Levinas understands this framing as tantamount to a hermeneutic universe in which the idea of our authentic possibility concerns only our death and underestimates the significance of the encounter with the other person. Only through a different hermeneutics, which reveals human existence as embodied and interpersonal, can we conceptualize the opening to responsibility that the encounter with the other person creates. For further discussion see Supplement S.3 on Levinas’ Hermeneutics.

Now, in Totality and Infinity, a further transition occurs, from the micro-sociality of the face-to-face encounter to social existence more broadly. This is possible thanks to language as teaching and dialogue (TI 194–197; 201–203), a claim that Merleau-Ponty would have approved. As indicated, earlier on, Levinas will open still another path to universalization—concerning the whole of humanity—through the family, in his final section “Beyond the Face” (TI 267–280). Despite this second path, the question remains how it is that, for Levinas and through the eyes of the other, the whole of humanity looks at me (TI 213). Gillian Rose first criticized this limited universalization of responsibility as lacking important socio-political mediations (1992). Elliot Wolfson has in turn questioned whether this lack is not based on “a false dichotomy[,] as both [responsibility and socio-political mediations] are…indebted conceptually to a Kantian dualism that neglects the middle” (Wolfson 2025: 109). Ernst Wolff investigated the passage toward universality in light of Levinas’ evolving conception of liberal society, from the latter’s skeptical stance toward a more positive appraisal (Wolff 2007). Finally, Elad Lapidot argues that through Levinas’ hermeneutics of the family, we obtain a micro- or meta-politics, wherein “the family [operates] as a counter-figure to the state, [like] a collective subject against a total object” (Lapidot 2021: 16). Lapidot adds arguments for a “völkisch” influence, borrowed here from Heidegger.[23]

Levinas admits that

[t]he acuity of the problem [of universalization] lies in the necessity of maintaining the I in the transcendence [of the face-to-face] with which it hitherto seemed incompatible [given its self-interests]. (TI 276)

That is, although the face-to-face is a momentary interruption, the trace of responsibility needs to be received and assured in a more durable way. Thanks to his focus on the family, Levinas does provide a partial expansion of responsibility by weaving together the responsibility of the father to his child and the micro-sociality of family life, in which the trace of interruptive time is historicized. This choice works responsibility out in terms one might today consider traditional or patriarchal, i.e., through paternal election and the service of the son to his brothers; something that, ironically, resembles the solidarity through intergenerational love found in Hegel’s early theological writings. This leads Levinas to assert that “the fecundity of the I is its very [temporal] transcendence” (TI 277). That is, through the time of generations, an ego surpasses itself through its children (TI 277). Thus, even as the time of generations “adds something new to being, something absolutely new” (TI 283), i.e., the child, it also provides a partial mediation between the affective instant of responsibility and the creation of institutions and practices apt to ensure that the ethical trace has some potential for extension.

Rose (1992), Derrida (1964 [1978: 121, 133–136]), and Didier Franck (2008: 233–243) have discussed the difficulty of mediations; viz., introducing ethics into questions of justice and politics. Part of the difficulty lies in the tension between universalization understood as the ethical cultivation of humanity, versus universalization understood as providing an ethical inflection to justice broadly conceived. For Levinas, the passage of responsibility into politics is invariably fragile, because ethical language is frequently imitated by political rhetoric. Yet, in 1961, the question of how responsibility and election experienced in the family passes into a vaster history and public space remains under-thematized, notably, as it concerns demands for social justice and equality. Herzog has argued that politics in Levinas is firstly “defined as concern and care for people’s hunger”, even before it is interest in power or defense of political rights (2020: 40).

Levinas himself responds by urging that the notion of fraternity is firstly hermeneutic, even before it is biological. Fraternity is an upshot of intersubjective relations. It flows out of face-to-face encounters and what he calls the human kinship forged by “monotheism” (TI 214). By this Levinas means the ethical core or essence of Judaism. As he argues,

the very status of the human implies fraternity and the idea of the human race. Fraternity is radically opposed to the conception of a humanity united by resemblance, a multiplicity of diverse families arisen from the stones cast behind by Deucalion, and which, across the struggle of egoisms, results in a human city. (TI 214)

Unification in difference is thus created only when monotheism results in a law that equalizes those obliged by it. Levinas similarly traces what he calls originary “religion” to the face-to-face, following his phenomenological genealogy of it (TI 40). Commentators have nevertheless insisted that, unless ethics can correct or amend justice on the basis of a subject’s experience of responsibility, the possibility its expansion remains open to doubt (Wolff 2007: 383–399). For many commentators, interpersonal responsibility remains the exception not the rule (Froese 2020). For hermeneutics (Hans-Georg Gadamer), responsibility itself depends on dialogue and established tradition, not on the abstract call of the other. Responsibility may be subject to codification, though that would be the concern of ethical theory, which is not Levinas’ priority (Morgan 2007: 238).

Two dilemmas thus arise in Totality and Infinity. It is an open question whether they are laid to rest in Otherwise than Being. The first concerns the dichotomy between what was traditionally called free will versus nature; the second, the aforementioned socio-cultural mediations between families and States. In the first case, it may be surprising that Levinas characterizes human existence in terms resembling those of physiological determinism, that is, in terms of drives and the interests flowing out of them. For him, the problem of reconciling freedom and nature would be one of interrupting the activity of the drives, which is the bodily substrate of consciousness, and which contributes to its dynamic temporal unity. Understanding the will, then, does not begin with freedom so much as with something closer to conatus essendi (i.e., with something “natural”).

Levinas proves close to Hobbes and Kant here. For the latter, the motivation to disregard one’s interests in favor of the moral law lies in the affect called Achtung. Kant urged that Achtung be considered in its negative and positive aspects: negatively, as attention or freedom from sensuous distraction. In its positive sense, Achtung corresponds to reverentia, respect, understood as the freedom to grasp the law as something eminently worthy of adherence, despite its imposed constraint. Moreover,

the presentation of something as [the] determining basis of our will humbles us in our self-consciousness when we compare it with the sensible propensity of our nature. (Kant KPV 1788: Pt I bk I ch. 3, AA 5: 74 [2002: 98]; Nancy 1983 [2003: 142]; Basterra 2015: 91–98)

As the focus of attention and motivation, Achtung is unique in that it is what Kant calls an intellectual affect (Kant KPV 1788 [2002: 87 / AA: 66]). It has no direct relationship to our bodily make-up, which, as we know also from Levinas, is indissociably tied up with drives and instincts. When thus motivated, practical reason determines itself to act out of respect for a law indemonstrable by theoretical reason. Practical reason thereby discovers freedom in the performance of its moral act. It is only then, post facto, that freedom is found to have reality, through self-obedience.

Basterra has argued that Kant’s ethics affords us an important insight into the question of nature versus freedom in Levinas. Whereas for both, the will follows its natural course (desires and emotions), something outside it may compel it toward ethical behavior or responsibility. For Kant, the categorical imperative does not “belong” to the self-positing subject, but rather addresses them as if from without and elicits humility. For Levinas, it is the face of the other that addresses us this way and focuses our attention, prior to our considering that face’s empirical qualities (sex, ethnicity, etc.) (Basterra 2015: 125–126). Recently, Wenjing Cai (2021) has observed that Basterra’s arguments for a limited reconciliation between Kant and Levinas produce “an otherness or excess within the subject”:

Basterra…argues that both the Kantian moral law and Levinas’s other indicate an otherness or excess within the subject, thereby making the subject of freedom an auto-heteronomous one. (2021: 406)

For his part, Alexander Altonji (2023) argues that Levinas’ concrete other is not only normative but that the command expressed in the face (“you shall not kill”) provides the best answer to the skeptics’ problem of other minds and other existences (Altonji 2023: 67). So much for recent debates on Levinas’ 1961 treatment of freedom and nature.

Let us turn now toward the second dilemma: the fraught relationship between ethics and politics. In 1961, Levinas characterizes politics and drives as unfolding in a similar fashion. Both are sites for the manifestation of the will to persist in existence. He doubts that politics, when “left to itself”, can long remain ethical (TI 300; Wolff 2007: 129). However, he remarks that justice can be addressed as an ethical demand posed to some States, notably liberal ones.

This does not solve the problem of mediations yet suggests that Rose’s Hegelian objection may be misguided. After all, what do the mediations ultimately serve, if not the finality of the State as overarching protector and regulator?[24] Levinas was aware of this. In 1951, in his first published article on the State of Israel, he did not hesitate to forestall accusations of idolatry even against a Jewish State. Arguing philosophically that the “State is not an idol because it precisely permits full self-consciousness”, he added that modern humans “acknowledge [their] spiritual nature…when acting in the service of the State and in their dignity as citizens”.[25] This is indeed why, he added, the decline of organized religions is tied to the advent of modern States. Here and elsewhere, he recognized that a State, and preeminently one founded on a religion, embodied a paradox whose solution—in Israel’s case at least—could only be found in an approach to religion as the symbolic pendant of ethical responsibility (DF 218). He thereupon added the more existential claim that

the Jewish people craved their own land and their own State, not because of the abstract independence which they desired, but because they could then finally begin the work of their lives. (DF 218)

Clearly, this is not an exhaustive solution to the problem of mediations between family (or ethnicity) and the State (or politics). We will return to this question in section 2.4.5. For a discussion of other commentators, see Supplement S.4 on Commentators on Levinas’ Politics

2.4 Otherwise than Being, or Beyond Essence (1974): Transcendence-in-Immanence

Otherwise than Being grew up around its core fourth chapter, entitled “Substitution” and first published in 1968 (OBBE 99–129; also see Bernasconi 2002; see further Simon Critchley 1999: 183–197). It is a justifiable simplification to say that Levinas’ concept of substitution corresponds to that of responsibility, explored this time as relationality in immanence rather than as “my” response to the face, understood as exteriority. In this work, Levinas uses the term “intériorité” repeatedly, which the translator renders as “inwardness”, perhaps to avoid introducing spatial binaries (OBBE 28, 87, 92, 108, 119). The work is not about inner-outer dichotomies, much less cognitive operations, or memories of events or things. It has little to do with the phenomenological discoveries emerging through what Husserl called “making present (Vergegenwärtigung)”. “Inwardness” denotes a bodily life as if haunted by others, which is also now called “proximity” (OBBE 81–94; Sebbah 2018b, 51–52 n. 17). Comparable in this to Husserl’s horizon of apperceptions, inwardness entails a spectrum of affective tones. Unlike Husserl, however, these tones require recourse to discursive figures that Levinas now borrows from psychology, poetics, hermeneutics, even theology and dogmatics (e.g., “obsession”, “persecution”, “recurrence”, “too tight in its skin”, “exile”, “maternity”, “love”, and finally “expiation” and “kenosis”).[26] While thus concerned with intersubjective affectivity in its immediate passive undergoing, substitution is manifest in human practice, the domain in which we experience immediacy.[27] By 1974, then, transcendence, understood as the other “outside” me, has become transcendence-in-immanence, in a sense closer to Merleau-Ponty’s account of intercorporeity, which similarly urged that philosophies of embodiment should never oppose the terms immanence and transcendence (PP 308). For Levinas, the concept of the other would still refer to the face as expression and exteriority, but it would denote principally the “inwardness” of memories that are not about objects yet whose affective return or “recurrence” further complexifies the linear time schema of Husserl’s early phenomenological consciousness (OBBE 88).

This insistence on living presence and practice, which represent Levinas’ resistance to objectification, can also be found today in phenomenologies that underscore the difference between a third-person perspective and a first-person one. Sebbah (2018a) has argued this point in light of what he calls an ethics of the “survivor”. Some have objected that Levinas’ late work reflected a certain survivor’s guilt. Sebbah takes up this charge resolutely, emphasizing that in Levinas’ philosophy the dead (those who did not survive) are not phantoms or even traces confined in archival documents. At the pre-reflective level, they do not belong to “the world”, or to an economy of being, so much as they carry on as affective saliences—persisting unremarked in our intersubjective relations.

Hence, preserving traces without life (i.e., without a living face), or even more in “enclosing” them within the horizon of the World, like tools among tools…or again in enclosing them within re-presentation through memory, ultimately comes down to endangering…the authentic [living] relation to the other.[28]

According to Sebbah, only the lived immediacy of the face-to-face holds the ontological order metaphorically open to transcendence. This first-person perspective is a theme that goes back to Maimonides’ negative theological critique of human language in light of the divine attributes of practice. In short, transcendence, expressed as the Good, is an old theme in Judaism. Levinas adapts it to his hermeneutic phenomenology and, by 1974, the immediacy of the face-to-face will be extended into the immanence of lived memory, even as these affective memories condition our interactions with others.

2.4.1 The Structure of the Work

Otherwise than Being opens with a general overview of the argument, in which being and transcendence are also named “essence” and “disinterest”. Emphasizing the processual quality of being, Levinas will refer to it equivalently as “being” or “essence”, venturing that he might even have used the dynamic form “essance” (OBBE 187 note 1). Responsibility will be focused and discussed as the condition of possibility of all verbal signification (OBBE 43–47). Totality and Infinity’s themes of conversation and teaching thus recede into the background. Levinas now makes a more strategic use of the body as flesh, that is, as a locus with simultaneously an inside and an outside, as in Merleau-Ponty. Subjectivity is again framed affectively as the coming to pass of responsibility, although this time the phenomenological approach to intentionality is analyzed into its basic layer of sensibility that Levinas calls “pre-originary susceptiveness [susception pré-originaire]” (OBBE 122, 136–138). For him, that means that subjectivity always entails pre-cognitive dimensions that are from the outset intersubjectively conditioned. The other has become other-in-the-same, as indicated.

To be sure, the other-in-the-same is not objectively different from the factical other who faces me, because neither one is an object and both are expressions or modes of alterity. As we will see, the other-in-the-same describes a pre-thematic “call” or “investiture” (indeed I never know when I first experienced this other in me) (OBBE 125). Levinas adopts the middle voice, of passivity-activity, here: “All my inwardness is invested [s’investit] in the form of a despite-me, for-another” (OBBE 11). Thus, in Otherwise than Being, Levinas has returned to Husserl’s inquiries into passive synthesis, to the latter’s perplexities about the stretching of our retentions of experiences, about the unbidden spontaneity of our associations, and the near-infinity of sensuous horizons—all part of a process unfolding passively in what Husserl called in 1926 “a phenomenology of the so-called unconscious”.[29] In light of this return, we should not approach interiority and exteriority as opposed terms, but as felt dimensions of intersubjectivity and the inhabitation of a self by alterity.

The second chapter approaches Heidegger’s discussion of language as the way in which being becomes, the way it temporalizes (BT §44b).[30] Levinas revisits Heidegger’s argument that the logos gathers up being and makes possible being’s unveiling (alētheia). He will argue that the lapse of time between lived immediacy and its reflective representation is never fully gathered by the logos. Therefore, the temporal lapse poses a challenge to language understood as Heidegger’s gathering. It falls, much the way that transcendence as interruption did in 1961, outside the realm of being-as-gathering, even though Levinas still considers being and language as processes of totalization, as an all-encompassing system. His rethinking of the lapse, with transcendence-in-immanence, will be Levinas’ ultimate modification of Heidegger’s project. Together, the lapse and this new conception of transcendence do ultimately pass through language, albeit as practice, as words addressed to someone. I will come back to this. For now, suffice it to say that it is the inhabitation of a self by alterity that forms the sensuous conditions of possibility of speech. Thus it is not being that addresses us through language, it is quite different; it is human alterity.

Two additional innovations in Otherwise than Being include:

  1. the proposed phenomenological reduction to the birth of meaning in a bodily self that carries within itself what it cannot identify as properly itself (the “other”, affectively). This appears to be a expansion of Husserl’s discussion of the pre-reflective ego in Ideas II (§58, “Supplement 12” §§2–3). Whereas Husserl emphasized the basis of the ego in its ongoing flow of lived experience, a flow characterized as “lawful”, on the basis of its own principles, Levinas focuses on discontinuities in time-consciousness (see also Franck 1981 [2013: 149–166]).
  2. A hermeneutics of the self, emerging through intersubjective contact in which the “proximity” of the other elicits passive “substitution” and opens onto spontaneous responding (OBBE 113–121). In what suggests an attempt at deepening Husserl’s concept of empathy (Einfühlung) (OBBE 125), the tropes of proximity, recurrence, and substitution characterize the pre-cognitive intersubjective intertwining that makes communication possible: “Communication would be impossible if it should have to begin in the ego, [in] a free subject, to whom every other would be only a limitation that invites war” (OBBE 119).

Indeed, prior to spoken or written language, prior to signs reciprocally exchanged, “we suppose that there is in the transcendence involved in language a relationship that is not empirical speech, but responsibility” (OBBE 120). Levinas calls this theme, inspired by Franz Rosenzweig’s Stammwort (root-word), “my pre-originary susceptiveness”.[31] In Levinas, the nature of intersubjective sensibility shares its time-structure with strong passions, sometimes indeed with trauma (OBBE 122–124). As Levinas writes:

[this susceptiveness] describes the suffering and vulnerability of the sensuous as the other in me…. [T]he ipseity [also known as embodied selfhood] has become at odds with itself in its return to itself. The self-accusation of remorse gnaws away at the closed and firm core of consciousness…fissioning it [in its temporal unity]. (OBBE 124–125)

Consequently, vulnerability and sensitivity to trauma not only provoke retreat into self but heighten our awareness, however tenuous, of our connection with the other. Thereupon they motivate verbal address and ultimately, bearing witness. Thus, the affective in-habitation of my self by an other precedes formal speech-acts and speech-communities. If the reverse were the case, that is, if a sociological community were posited as prior to the event of the address, then this would presuppose what it was meant to show: the affective genesis of speech-acts (OBBE 92). In other words, “beneath” words proffered lies a fundamental vulnerability that psychology might interpret as a tendency to witnessing, from oneself to the other. Levinas calls this vulnerability the “Saying” (OBBE 149–152). It is the condition of possibility of words uttered in the form of response (i.e., pre-linguistic), and it accompanies communication like its affective horizon. The duality of Saying and Said, or words uttered, is a new concept in Levinas’ late work.

Building on the exploration of proximity begun in chapter three, chapters four and five evince a tone more somber than any found hitherto in Levinas’ œuvre. This is in keeping with the dedications of the book, written in Hebrew and in French, which announce that it will be a work of mourning. While Derrida characterized Totality and Infinity as a phenomenology of hospitality (Derrida 1997 [1999: 21]), Otherwise than Being commemorates the “victims of the…hatred of the other man”. It develops the parallel between semiotic “substitution” of a word for a thing (the signifying function of all language) and the affective substitution of myself for an other, extended through a spectrum of acts of self-sacrifice, from daily empathy to interventions enacted for the other. This is what Levinas calls the one-for-the-other (OBBE 45–50, 70–74, 119–129). Whereas Heidegger had explored the hermeneutics of Da-sein, for whom communication unfolds thanks to our (as Da-sein) taking or equivalently offering “this [thing or word] as that [thing]” (BT §31), Levinas will arguably set Heidegger’s “as” into his “for”:[32] Heidegger’s “this as that” becomes Levinas’ “one for the other” of substitution. While responsibility expressed the unfolding of the intersubjective affects that Levinas compared to Plato’s “Good beyond Being” in 1961 (TI 292–293, 304–307), the good of substitution is more ambiguous, occurring “on the brink of tears and laughter” (OBBE 18), yet also “glorious” (OBBE 94, 140–144).

The experience of time characteristic of trauma and mourning does not take the place of Husserlian phenomenology’s flowing time-consciousness,[33] any more than it replaces the succession and uninterruptedness of clock time. If what-is results from the self-giving of things to the focus of phenomenological attention, and if together they invariably find a place in the formal flow of time-consciousness, then even for Husserl what-is, i.e., being, temporalizes as consciousness. Husserl had always urged that, insofar as there is appearing, there is an indication of being (CM §46; also see Heidegger, BT §7). For Heidegger, being temporalizes through Da-sein, which is out-ahead-of-itself or oriented toward its future. Yet if, in both their cases, being unfolds temporally, then for Levinas, our sensibility shows a different temporal character, because the sensibility called the other-in-the-same returns and repeats rather than flows. In its new somber tones as trauma and mourning, responsibility recurs without definitively halting the flow of time-consciousness. This is why Levinas referred to the cluster of concepts around substitution as adverbial: they inflect or modalize being (understood as processual) and its time, thereby temporarily modifying it. Indeed, when being is understood as the verbal dynamism expressed by “essence”, then responsibility and substitution can only be compared to ad-verbs. Hence the title, autrement, other-wise (than being), which itself is an adverb (OBBE 35). This is a kind of wager; it does not abrogate the ontological character of existence; rather, it suggests inflections of it.

The final half of chapter five recurs to the performative register of language. It seeks to convey the tension of a consciousness striving to consolidate itself in the wake of alterity as affective investiture, by which its passivity slowly becomes active witnessing. This opening out of inward affects becoming gestures of generosity motivates Otherwise than Being’s recourse to the new performative language. Levinas adds,

and I still interrupt the ultimate discourse in which all the discourses are stated, in saying it to one that listens…That is true of the discussion I am elaborating at this very moment. (OBBE 170; see Derrida’s commentary on this, 1980 [1991])

He is no doubt aware of the seemingly artificial quality of calling his authorial witness “immediate”. But Levinas’ claim is more than a literary artifice. Basterra compares it to Kant’s idea of autonomy, which shows itself only when we follow a law that “exceeds and addresses the subject”, motivating its ethical act (Basterra 2015: 126). Earlier in her above-mentioned study, she had argued that the intellectual affect of Achtung was capable of focusing our attention and opening us to a respect comparable to Levinas’ Saying, which he also calls “sincerity”. For pure reason, autonomy “is therefore an illusion”, but it is one only insofar as that which is not intrinsically part of my interests can still motivate me to act. Thus pure reason erroneously supposes that my ethical gesture came from me (Basterra 2015: 129). Levinas provides us a crucial hermeneutics of the intersubjective origin of this “illusion” denounced in the first Critique. He sets the heteronomy of Kant’s practical reason into a hermeneutic register, referring to the sincerity underlying the words we offer: “It is in the risky uncovering of oneself, in sincerity, the breaking up of inwardness…exposure to traumas, vulnerability” that I bear witness to and for another (OBBE 48). Again, this does not come from us. It arises from being faced by an other, and it persists as affective memory in our lived body. Indeed, when asked, Levinas finds illustrations of such witnessing in many places, from the justice imperative of the Biblical prophets to the concern of Latin American clerics over the events unfolding in Chile in 1973 (OGCM 81–82).

2.4.2 New Existential Moods and Fleshly Memories

As in his 1935 discussion of need and nausea, Levinas argues in Otherwise than Being that lived sensibility often overflows representations of it. And again, he proposes sensuous modes different from Heidegger’s Befindlichkeiten (see §2.2 supra), in which all understanding takes place for him (BT 17). Indeed, interwoven layers of affectivity are unfolded in Otherwise than Being. Levinas explores the sensuous-affective proto-experience of the other in light of new moods, writing: “Remorse is the trope of the literal sense of sensibility. In its passivity is erased the distinction between being accused and accusing oneself” (OBBE 125). Unlike Existence and Existents, wherein light overcomes the distinction between subjects and objects, allowing the subject to make an object intelligible for itself within the horizon of its appearing (EE 41), Otherwise than Being approaches transcendence in sensuous and temporal terms, arguing for the insistence of a past that eludes thematization, what he calls the “immemorial” (OBBE 122–123). Transcendence for an embodied being would always thus be transcendence-in-immanence. The affective “experience” of my relations with particular others is preserved as a trace or pre-thematic reminiscence of the flesh, as “a relationship with a singularity without the mediation of any principle, any ideality” (OBBE 100). Invoking Otherwise than Being (OBBE 105–107), John Llewelyn called this affective dimension of invested selfhood, or “ipseity”, a “‘deep’ saying” that “bears witness to what is neither recollected nor forgotten in the epistemic sense of these terms when [or once] it is represented as a sign” (Llewelyn 2002: 135).[34]

As indicated, Otherwise than Being problematizes Levinas’ earlier, more ontological approach in Totality and Infinity. He proceeds now on the basis of Husserl’s inquiries into passive syntheses, notes on intersubjectivity, and Einfühlung (empathy). There is good reason for this. Responsibility denoted an event that repeats, and even intensifies as it is assumed (already TI 100–101). In Otherwise than Being, however, the question of immanence and passivity arises in regard to responsibility’s unremarked persistence and its affective upwellings in us. This is because the status of a memory of sensuous events, which may have affected us outside of any representation we form, is elusive. For the phenomenologist, it might correspond to an apperception or horizon, in the sense of something that conditions perception but is not directly perceived. Thus Levinas also insists that, unlike the apperceptions Husserl explored thanks to the reduction he set on memory,[35] this affective past continues to escape thematization because it was never intentional at all, and because “memories” of our lived flesh precede the consolidation of our ego (OBBE 144–147).[36] John Drabinski has explored this “pre-history” in light of Levinas’ reprise of genetic phenomenology (2001: 185–206). Theodor de Boer approaches it as an echo of both Rosenzweig and Jewish prophetism (1997: 87–100). Sebbah (2018a, 39–57) argues that the “subject” of such “trials” must be the witness; he argues that Levinas proposes a unique epochē through which to approach affective vulnerability.

Levinas is aware that a counter-temporality of the affects is open to critique. He even reminds us that skepticism—even that concerning his hermeneutic wager—obeys an ethical imperative to deconstruct philosophy and with it, all totalizing discourses, whether they are logical or political (OBBE 168–170).

Unlike Husserl, Levinas does not theorize a system consisting of levels of drives and affects intentionalized by higher egoic acts.[37] He does exploit, however, a difficulty that beset Husserl’s early eidetic phenomenology. The difficulty concerns bodily sensation in relation to the flow of intentionality, as discussed by Husserl in Appendix 12 of his lectures on inner time-consciousness (PCIT 130–133).[38] For Husserl, in order to be experienced, sensation had to be intentional. Whereas, ever for him, the bodily origins of intentionality were the concern of physiological psychology, he recognized that the ongoing alterations in the body accounted for our feeling of temporal progression. In short, as they intentionalized, sensuous changes were in fact responsible for the experience of the flow of inner time, the same flow precisely that conferred temporal order upon conscious sensations. Phenomenology thereby remained consistent with itself as the eidetics of consciousness. But it did so at the price of disregarding preconscious processes, like what Husserl later called affektive Kräfte (affective forces) that would only be explored later in phenomenology’s genetic period starting around 1918.

Levinas first addressed Husserl’s difficulty in his 1965 essay, “Intentionality and Sensation” (DEH 135–150). Intentionalizing sensation was, he said, “[t]he original mark of Husserlian idealism” (DEH 141). Unlike Husserl, who addressed the problem with his speculative use of concepts like “affective forces” (affektive Kräfte), Levinas developed his conception of “diachrony” 1974, OBBE 9–10, 52), that is, the sensuous interruption that he equated with transcendence-in-immanence. Levinas focused on the gap (i.e., diachrony) between bodily sensation entering intentionality and sensation as pre-conscious processes occurring at the intersubjective level.

Levinas thus compared the duality of sensibility as conscious and preconscious to his idea of a pre-intentional “receptivity of an ‘other’ penetrating into the ‘same’, [in sum, into our intersubjective] life and not [into] ‘thought’” (DEH 144). This sensuous alterity will support two important claims; i.e., that intersubjective affects overflow the framework of representational consciousness, and that affective interruptions can obtrude on the even flow of time-consciousness.[39] Similarly, Sophie Veulemans has compared Levinas’ diachrony with Bergson’s approach to the “new” (sensuous modification) in the midst of duration (Veulemans 2008). Rudolf Bernet, in turn, equates the newness of the phenomenological instant with “the root of all alterity and all difference” in Levinas. This allows Bernet to urge that the intersubjective investiture of the subject “will always [prove] unthinkable in a philosophy of consciousness” (Bernet 2002: 93; also see OBBE 124). Following his argument, classical phenomenology would not have adequately thought through the sensuous way “in which the other liberates the subject from its captivity within …[its own] immanence” (Bernet 2002: 93).

2.4.3 The Saying and the Said

Otherwise than Being involves an innovative discussion of signification. Given Levinas’ hermeneutic insight that language is not merely a system of words paired up with pre-existing objective realities, but instead brings reality to light, language and time will have analogous functions.[40] That is, both make meaning possible as the realization of ourselves in the world. Indeed, while Heidegger had argued that being resonates in (poetic) language as the verb “to be”, Levinas counter-argued for an otherwise than being that glimmered in ad-verbial meaning, opening to transcendence. Yet, if the relationship between language and being is fully encompassing, as it is for Heidegger, then either Levinas’ otherwise than being looks like mere speculation, or it simply inheres in being or participates in its verb-like dynamism. Either way, fundamental ontology thereby proves primordial and weakens Levinas’ claims. That being said, for him, the transcendence indicated by the adverbial points toward a temporality that differs both from the flow of time-consciousness as theorized by Husserl and from the self-temporalization characteristic of Da-sein in Heidegger (i.e., as out-ahead-of-itself toward its ownmost possibility) (OBBE 169–170, 178–182).

The lapse of time between the pre-intentional sensuous moment and its intentionalization in consciousness corresponds to what Levinas calls the “Saying” (OBBE 37–55), the condition of possibility of words addressed. His discussion of the Saying correlates with his treatment of sincerity, introduced already in Existence and Existents. Otherwise than Being radicalizes this notion, insisting that the structure of sensibility is always as if punctuated by sensuous lapses. It is thanks to such temporal lapses that we are open and able to communicate because, as we have seen, proximity is an affective mode that motivates dialogue. While all sensuous lapses are not necessarily openings to intersubjective relationality, proximity and vulnerability are the loci of transcendence-in-immanence and the birth of signification (whether words are actually uttered or not). For Levinas, there is more in living affectivity than in what Heidegger’s conception of being speaking through language had captured. This becomes clear the moment we understand signification originally as an affective pre-intentionality and not as some thought, already formulated, that the I thereupon chooses to communicate to an other (OBBE 43).

Levinas thus conceives language as more than denotation and description. Already verbs escape the coupling of words with things that we find in the case of the noun. “In the verb of apophansis [predication], which is the verb properly so called, [i.e.,] the verb ‘to be’, essence resounds and is heard” (OBBE 41). “Red reddens” without requiring conversion into propositions; sounds resound in music and poetry. Nevertheless, a verb can be converted into a noun, thereby losing its processual quality.

Through the ambiguousness of the logos…the verb par excellence [“being”] in which essence resounds…is nominalized, becomes a word designating and sanctioning identities, assembling time…into a conjuncture;

or situation (OBBE 42). Hence, even the verbality or event-like quality of being can take on a nominal form, such as in “a being”. Levinas calls this convertibility “the amphibology of being and entities [beings]” (OBBE 43). While this reciprocal reference expresses the danger of taking being for a thing—a danger about which Heidegger warned us—what Levinas calls the amphibology neglects a unique aspect of some verbs: their reflexive quality.

Thus verbs like se dire, understood as “to say” but in a reflexive sense, are determined by the “se” or self, as though one were thereby saying oneself, self-communicating. Levinas now sets his ethical-hermeneutic reduction on the reflexive particle se, urging that, although being “speaks” through the logos, the se points toward a mode of our embodied sensuous passivity (OBBE 43–45). In short, Levinas accepts the Heideggerian claim about being expressing itself through language, but he adds the observation that reflexive verbs bespeak a subjective giving that is not found in verbs, transitive or intransitive. The “se” is not itself a verb, it corresponds to the passive pre-condition of communication, the way a self would also do. This passivity is enigmatic because the se is neither a verb nor even a noun; it is considered a particle or a reflexive pronoun. Yet this particle is indispensable to the middle voice of a host of verbs in many Latin languages. It is thanks to its enigmatic function that our subjective vulnerability to the other grounds the dynamics of words said to that other. To this reflexive se corresponds our passivity as it comes to light in the temporal lapse called “diachrony”. Diachrony thereby expresses our sincerity toward the other and transcendence, understood in a practical sense: “[T]he spirit hears the echo of the otherwise” (OBBE 44) in the words we offer and perform, and thus not merely as the words we offer. With the adverb (“otherwise”), a modalization of fleshly investiture momentarily escapes the nominalization available to many verbs, including that of being (i.e., between being and a being). As indicated, we find here the practical sense of transcendence, which Levinas compares with Merleau-Ponty’s “fundamental historicity”, those unremarked, passive bodily sedimentations that make up our selfhood (OBBE 45).

2.4.4 Hermeneutics and Jewish Philosophy

Levinas’ later work, notably Otherwise than Being, has been characterized as hermeneutical. Focusing on the discussions of the other-in-the-same and passivity in that work, commentator Giuseppe Lissa provides an apt description of Levinas’ interpretive project. By investigating the depths of consciousness, by comparing its passivity to the process of ageing, Levinas investigates a

reality unknowable, but perhaps interpretable by a thinking that no longer claims to be an exercise in knowledge…because this thinking is engaged in the search for a meaning that precedes all knowledge.

Lissa concludes that Levinas intimates a meaning that, in “preceding [knowledge], founds it, orients it, and to some degree justifies it” (Lissa 2002: 227). For him, Levinas’ turn to hermeneutics largely dates from his abandonment of the phenomenology of “exteriority”, as the subtitle of Totality and Infinity indicates: An Essay on Exteriority. As we have seen, insofar as the search for meaning underlying all manner of intentional constitution and other modes of intentionality presupposes a meaning only incipiently grasped—something that corresponds to Heidegger’s rethinking of hermeneutics in light of Da-sein’s basic understanding—Levinas appears to owe a debt to two forms of hermeneutic practice. On the one hand, to Heidegger’s existential hermeneutics;[41] on the other, to a much older, polyphonic practice of reading. This is Talmudic thought interpretively elaborating Jewish law (Halakhah) and recounting and parsing narratives (Aggadah). Lapidot (2021) refers to this dualism as an “inter-epistemic” divide, which is sometimes carried in philosophy as an “inner-philosophical drama” (2021: 5). According to Lapidot, this divide between “Athens” and “Jerusalem” is fecund, as it permits Levinas to mobilize Jewish traditions to interrupt the tendency of systematic epistemology to conceptualize the world (cf. “ontological imperialism”, as Lapidot writes, citing Totality and Infinity). To be sure, a significant difference between this hermeneutics and that of Christian theology lies in its giving less weight to philosophical justifications of faith. Let us turn briefly to this hermeneutics.

Levinas presented twenty-three Talmudic readings in the context of the Colloques des intellectuels juifs de langue française. Ethan Kleinberg has recently discussed four of these readings with acute attention to the growth of Jewish themes in Levinas’ philosophical project (Kleinberg 2021). It bears noting that, in 1957, at the first meeting of the colloquium, Levinas merely participated in the debates. Salomon Malka reminds us of one of his profoundly hermeneutic observations around that time:

Judaism is not a religion, the word doesn’t exist in Hebrew; it is much more than that, it is an understanding of being. The Jews introduced into history the idea of hope and that of a future…. Moreover, Jews have the sentiment that their obligations toward the other person come before their obligations in regard to God. (Malka 2002: 42, my trans., emph. added)

This remark already shows us three important things. First, that Judaism might be an “understanding of being” implies that it can encompasse ontology. Second, that Judaism was profoundly aware of finitude as both precarity and mortality. By extension, the hermeneutic life of Jewish traditions is an unfinished, ongoing process. Third, that our obligations to other persons come before duties toward God (from rituals to norms), and occasionally abrogate these duties, denotes a secularizing élan, or better, a human-oriented dimension within Judaism. This helps us grasp how it is that Levinas found resources in Heidegger’s hermeneutics, both utilizing and criticizing its concepts and method.

The relationship between Levinas’ thought, its Jewish influences, and phenomenological philosophy has given rise to multiple evaluations. Martin Kavka argues that “Levinas understood both Judaism and Western philosophy as engaging in structurally similar forms of thinking” (Kavka 2010: 20–21). He situates the structural similarity in that “both [these intellectual corpuses] consist of texts that point to what cannot be brought to presence” and consequently work between the dimensions of reference, explanation, and hermeneutic pre-comprehension (cf. Ouaknin 1993: 225 [1995: 155–156]).[42] To be sure, for European philosophy, the transcendence of the Good is often integrated into epistemological projects (e.g., Descartes). Against Kavka’s claim, Lapidot emphasizes foundational differences: a method that departs decisively “from vision-based, objectifying thought ‘reveal[s] it as implanted in…a forgotten experience from which it lives’” (2021: 8). Moreover, a foundation in axiology, or a thinking of relational values, is a notable Jewish contribution to philosophies of language and intersubjectivity. However, this foundation arises first as voice—as teaching. That means that the tradition unfolds around the auditory register rather than the visual one, the way I carry a voice within me as opposed to constituting something visually, at a distance.

Kavka and Michael Fagenblat certainly recognize the profound historicity of this dimension of Jewish thought: indeed, “it is not clear…that…a ‘new direction’ in Jewish philosophy is [ever] really new” (Kavka 2010: 21). Fagenblat examines the hermeneutic extension that Otherwise than Being gives to Totality and Infinity, and both commentators argue that Levinas’ increasingly critical stance toward the epistemological and foundationalist aspects of Husserlian phenomenology motivated him to expand his hermeneutic recourse both to Heidegger’s Existenzphilosophie and toward Jewish thought, including Neo-Platonic currents and Maimonides (Fagenblat 2010: 97–110).[43] But it should be emphasized that Levinas’ hermeneutics begins well before Otherwise than Being. His reinterpretation of being-in-the-world, the meaning of facticity, the creation of a dwelling, and even his reading of eros and the family in 1961 entail interpretive choices, indebted to at least two significant hermeneutic themes: Heidegger’s interpretation of our pre-comprehension of existence and Rosenzweig’s approach to Jewish life in The Star of Redemption (SE 1921 [2005]).

In 1961, Levinas wrote that Rosenzweig’s Star of Redemption was “too often present in this book [Totality and Infinity] to be cited” (TI 28), and numerous are the commentaries on the presence of Rosenzweig in Levinas’ work.[44] It is important to recall that Rosenzweig had been a scholar of Hegel until the experience of the trenches in World War I motivated his substituting the limited community forged by Sprachdenken for Hegel’s idealist political philosophy; universalizing dialectics gave way to an existential relationality that preserved singularity through dialogue. The Star of Redemption is a complex work analyzing the lived times of Jews and Christians, with a view to conceiving a certain extension of Judaism via Christianity over the course of their histories. At the core of each one lay a task and a profound, if disparate, intuition: a Sprachdenken (dialogical thinking) engendered by a revelation. Peter Eli Gordon has argued that Rosenzweig is “a post-Nietzschean philosopher”, a post-death of God thinker who thereby opened this “God” to relationality, however enigmatic. Gordon observes that,

like Heidegger, Rosenzweig’s new thinking denies that human meaning is intelligible independent of a life- and other-context. Temporal hermeneutics thus replaces the transcendental search for essence. (Gordon 2003: 185)

The same could be said of Levinas. Since he conceives temporality in human terms (as opposed to eternity or stasis), meaning itself can only be approached in light of time. Readers familiar with Rosenzweig’s “neues Denken” may know that he situated one of the principal hermeneutic differences between Judaism and Christianity in the way their theologies “temporalized”, with Christianity being oriented around the life and death of the incarnate God, an event whose occurrence lies in the historic past, and Judaism, as historically future-oriented, i.e., ongoingly awaiting the messiah.

Levinas took up the question of meaning and temporality in a way somewhat different from both Rosenzweig and Heidegger. In 1961, as we have seen, his phenomenology of hospitality proceeded on the present-time of love of life in the world and the momentary encounter called the face-to-face. However, the place where he explicitly uses the term “phenomenology” therein concerns precisely a secularized messianic future. This is the chapter entitled “Phenomenology of Eros”, which deploys “a phenomenological model for the ultimate term of our desire”, as Fagenblat puts it (2010: 93). To this Lapidot adds, the family flowing out of eros would be “beyond the finite individual…the infinite individual being the ‘ultimate structure’ of being, ‘produced as multiple and as split into Same and Other’ (TI 308)”—this would be the we of the family (Lapidot 2021: 15).

The argument would be this: before eros is sublimated in civil society, eros and the family bring to light our concern with others in their particularity and difference, independently of their biological or social roles. We can take the family as a “model” here, in the Frankfurt School’s sense of “an intellectual construction…[whose elements] are borrowed from empirical experiences that have already shown their worth” (Broch 2008: 43). The phenomenology of eros opens a future of “election” within the family and perhaps beyond it. Despite the apparent heterosexism of his formulations, Levinas introduces an abiding concern for singularity and uniqueness by defining the figure of paternity as the possibility of electing each son in his specificity, just as the latter may serve (and clash with) his brothers. Consistent with a model, the family is both figure and reality. It serves Levinas’ hermeneutic secularization of messianic future-time, inspired by Rosenzweig, through the succession of generations. Interestingly, eros unfolds “phenomenologically” in much the same way eas did the proto-experience of the “there is” (il y a). That is, it unfolds in a darkness overlooked by phenomenologies that rely on light and the universal evidence that light enables (TI 256). There would consequently be a neglected underside to the phenomenological account of constitution, which precedes and accompanies intentionality’s encounter with objects and world. And that requires hermeneutics, as Moati observes in Levinas and the Night of Being (2012 [2017]). For further discussion of Jewish hermeneutics, see Supplement S.5 on Hermeneutics and Jewish Philosophy.

Like Fagenblat, scholars from David Banon to Marc-Alain Ouaknin to Sebbah have explored the hermeneutic dimension of Levinas’ thought, even beyond his Talmudic readings that delve into the many-voiced debates between the rabbis of the Mishnah and the Gemara (the oldest and subsequent transcriptions of Jewish oral traditions) (Banon 1987).[45] As Ouaknin points out, in the case of Talmudic and Biblical hermeneutics, Levinas always considered the eminence of a book—what defines it as “the Book”—to be less its themes than its structure. Levinas focuses “on the structure of the Book of books inasmuch as it allows for exegesis [hermeneutics], and on its unique status of containing more than it contains”.[46]

Hermeneutics is thus engendered by excesses of potential meaning over senses already printed on the page, or even discerned by the reception traditions of the work. It would thus be the specific architecture of the book that conditions its reception. Moreover, the parallelisms that we have seen—between the Saying and the Said and between temporal diachrony and synchrony—are also found at the literary level in Biblical and Talmudic texts, with their openness to ongoing interpretation. Levinas even equates “revelation” with the call of the text to each reader or listener, who thereby becomes responsible for its interpretation. “The Revelation as calling to the unique within me is the significance particular to the signifying of the Revelation” of the text, which is understood as dialogical to its core. Here we see the structural analogy between the call of the other and my response that begins as Saying, as opening to words addressed. Levinas adds,

the totality of the true is constituted from the contribution of multiple people, the uniqueness of each act of listening carrying the secret of the text; the voice of the Revelation, as inflected…by each person’s ear, would be necessary to the ‘Whole’ of the truth. (BTV 133–134)

Hermeneutic truth here becomes the responsibility of an open community, as much as an invitation to participation extended to each possible listener. That is why Levinas could urge that Scripture be understood as summoning the reader to respond as readily as the subject was called to respond, i.e., through situations of responsibility. All of these express an ethical investiture that results in words offered. The here and now of scriptural voices and reading stands analogous to the here and now of the face-to-face encounter and the fact that memory occurs by definition in the present.

Levinas’ hermeneutics might nevertheless be deemed immanent, i.e., concerning one book and one community. Although commentators like Leora Batnitzky find in Levinas a project for a modern politics, and thus for universality, others are skeptical about her claim. Trigano objects that Levinas’ ethics unfolds out of a sort of non-site, starting with the category of the singular. “For Levinas”, he argues,

it is ethically imperative to think the singular in order that the horizon of the other person arise. The universal is, in effect, a dangerous game that can lead to totality and to the negation of the other person. To decide in favor of the singular is to avoid such a development

and with it, a closed politics (Trigano 2002: 173). Froese (2020) argues that we can derive a utopian politics from Levinas’ hermeneutics, provided that we understand the levels of subjectivity he explores, including the affective and pre-conscious level in which original intersubjectivity is born. This requires mobilizing a genetic phenomenological method. And perhaps for that reason, it has been largely missed by left and liberal readers who see in Levinas “a pure ideological fantasy” (Froese 2020: 4), one that readily aligns with neoliberalism. As Froese insists, however,

the social bond between subjects is not predicated on a common experience or shared horizon of meaning, but simply [on] the experience of the self, as a self is necessarily mediated in and through others. (2020: 12)

Without this understanding, there is little way to mobilize Levinas’ philosophy as a critique of politics.

In sum, the hermeneutic and phenomenological turn that Levinas gives to Husserl and Heidegger has led to debates about the relationship between an immanent hermeneutics and one concerned with politics as the sphere of the universal. Herzog argues in the same vein as Froese, for a Jewish and Levinasian universalism, provided we accept her thesis that ethics and politics mutually interrupt each other—with ethics urging us toward a “surplus of responsibility” and politics representing the inescapable context and risk that besets responsibility. To demonstrate her claim, Herzog engages an extensive study of the politics of the law as debated in the Talmud and presented in Levinas’ Talmudic readings (Herzog 2020: 38–57, 94–119). These questions imply discussions about politics in our time from which Levinas might have refrained in his time, in the wake of the Shoah, when politics seemed less important than questions of the future of Jewish communities. Be that as it may, even objections that claim to be phenomenological and not ideological (Drabinski 2011: 41) fail to emphasize that phenomenology itself contains a Cartesian egology, with transcendental and lifeworld egoic layers, as well as a psychological level derived from the embodied experience of affectivity, including intersubjective affects.

Much of the debate about Levinas’ politics unfolded successively in France and then in the English-speaking world. Michel Haar (1991: 530) asked of Levinas whether his ethics could really unfold outside of any site, outside of any positive reciprocity, and outside all objectivation (cited by Trigano 2002: 175, note 79). Trigano criticized Levinas, urging that the dialectical relationship between singular experience and universal meaning (and institutions) implies that philosophy should have a minimal relationship to politics (Trigano 2002: 176). On Trigano’s account, it follows that Levinas’ hermeneutics only partly responded to Jews’ post-war need for the universalization of their experience, at a human level encompassing both theory and political practice (Trigano 2002: 176). This does not contradict Batnitzky’s reading, which considers Levinas’ œuvre as a whole. But it can be argued that universalization in Levinas’ ethics remains largely formal. On this question turns the important matter of what it means to develop a Jewish philosophy today.

Numerous are the objections to what we could call Levinas’ “genetic hermeneutics”. Terry Eagleton (2009), Slavoj Žižek (2005), and Simon Critchley (2004), among others, have read Levinas as though the face-to-face encounter represented a retreat into private life, without reference to or concern for social and political existence. Froese speaks, by contrast, in terms of “entanglement” (2020: 11), echoing Levinas’ own arguments that the social-structural dimension of our relationship to alterity is itself impoverished when we neglect the “pre-subjective plane of analysis”, made possible through genetic phenomenology (2020: 11). Sebbah (2018a, 40–46) also emphasizes Levinas’ hermeneutic argument for the “separation” that defines the subject in the world; this must be taken seriously throughout. Stated otherwise, the subject is in the world yet not wholly of the world:

the true interiority is nothing of the world and certainly not as an “inside” that would be “situatable” in that world. Hope and responsibility—when nothing of the world remains standing, or only remains standing in the crude light of wretchedness—resist because they are neither of the world, nor of being. Hope and responsibility whereby, in a sense, interiority is evasion or escape itself. (Sebbah 2018a, 31)

2.4.5 The Third Party, Illeity, and Politics

Derrida once called Totality and Infinity a “treatise on hospitality” (1997 [1999: 21]). As we have seen, Levinas’ 1961 work approached being as the conflict of wills that persist in their existence, like the philosophical tradition’s concept of conatus essendi (the will to persist in being). Neutral existence or the there-is (il y a) denoted indeterminate nocturnal being, which gives way to the diurnal being called “the elemental” (sunlight, winds, rain). As noted, being in Levinas thus entails both dynamic forces and a conception of natural processes. Hospitality, also called “metaphysical desire” (TI 33), cannot be grounded on such forces, much less on a conception of the will, whether based on drives of self-preservation or self-enhancement. And, because hospitality is elicited by the other—and is non-reciprocal—it does not presuppose a prior social-contractual exchange, much less moral sentiments or innate emotive capacities for empathy or compassion. If it did, there would be no question of escaping a so-called natural order of existence.

That is why Levinas—aware that the concept of nature itself has a debated history—characterizes our response to the other, which by 1974 is also called “pre-natural signification” (OBBE 68). He now argues in phenomenological terms,

[i]n renouncing intentionality as a guiding thread toward the eidos [formal structure] of the psyche…our analysis will follow sensibility in its pre-natural signification to the maternal, where, in proximity [to what is not itself], signification signifies before it gets bent into perseverance in being in the midst of a Nature. (OBBE 68, emph. added)

“The maternal”, here, is a figure for the affective experience of bearing within oneself what is not solely oneself. The point is ultimately that intersubjective sensibility, inaugurated by the approach of the other person, eludes the “mechanistic causality” observed in natural processes, as well as the “natural necessity” attributed to instincts. We shall see shortly what this implies for the famous “Third party”.

In order to develop further the idea of signification as pre-natural, as pre-conative, Levinas found himself compelled to develop further concepts. In 1961, he had referred to our desire for the other as “religion” (“the bond…established between the same and the other” ) and as “transascendence”. “Transcendence, like desire and inadequation, is necessarily a transascendence” (respectively TI 41, 35), which underscores the immediacy and even sensuousness of the response. By 1974, Levinas calls the value and dignity of responding to another person, “illeity”. He defines illeity as “a neologism formed with il (he) or ille, [whereby alterity] indicates a way of concerning me without entering into conjunction with me”—without conjunction with me, whether in thought or in act (OBBE 12; also 13–16, 147–162). Beyond the concept of the third party introduced already in Totality and Infinity, “illeity” also refers to something absolute, even divine, in the other person. We can see here how our responsibility to the other thus stands in the place of our responsibility to God, or simply evokes it, which is a crucial hermeneutic dimension of Judaism.

The question remains, as it did already in Totality and Infinity: how does an investiture of this affective intensity pass into rationality? Consequently, how does embodied affectivity play a transcendental role, as condition of possibility, in the experience of temporal interruption, also known as responsibility, i.e., the moment of my responding? Would responsibility and transcendence not thereupon enter the ongoing flow of time (transcendental consciousness) and be confounded with being as totality? The relationship between the transcendental and the empirical has caused much ink to flow. For example, some have argued that Kant’s late-published Doctrine of Virtue (1797) set forth avenues for empirical illustrations of the transcendental, categorial imperative (see for example Smit & Timmons 2013). Indeed, ongoing debates have not decided the question of whether the Husserlian temporal transcendental, called inner time-consciousness, is or is not open in its purity to description. To be sure, the transcendental flow is a condition of possibility of empirical experience in Husserl. As to Levinas, in both the 1961 work and that of 1974, we find that the “third party”—denoting both other people and the reprise of intentionality—similarly “looks at me through the eyes of the other” (TI 213). Here the passage to reason, social existence, and objective time occurs because the temporal lapse Levinas calls “diachrony” is invariably resorbed, if in part, by intentional consciousness. Intersubjective affectivity and, in a sense, the body itself thus play the role of a transcendental in Levinas, who also recognizes that affects are always on the verge of becoming intentional (PCIT Appendix 12); in short, objects of empirical consciousness.

In like manner, responsibility and fraternity, which are formulated by 1974 as the other-in-the-same, still leave a trace in social relations. The trace is mnemonic and bodily, as indicated, and it emerges from affective relationality, its condition of possibility. We find it in our concern for restorative justice, even for a more modest equity. This empirical concern for justice does not erase the Hobbesian conception of drives in human collectivities. The trace introduces ambiguity into existence or being; it allows exceptional acts of generosity to phenomenalize. In temporal terms, diachrony crosses through synchrony. Or, as Herzog puts it, the world, although chaotic, is also the site in which responsibility proves visible (Herzog 2020: 40–42).

By 1974, then, the ambiguity of the passive temporality that Levinas likens to ageing and describes as “diachrony” (OBBE 54) relative to the all-structuring flow of time-consciousness has become more marked. Levinas inquires, “[d]oes a face abide in representation and in proximity; is it community and difference?” (OBBE 154, emph. added). The answer appears to be “yes”, albeit at two metaphoric levels. The face, conceived as representation, fixes the dynamism of the face as expression; representation fixes the dynamism of affective investiture that arises from the aforementioned intersubjective transcendental. Adopting a different terminology, Levinas writes,

[t]he third party introduces a contradiction into the Saying whose signification before the other until then went in one direction [toward the singular other]. [The third] is of itself the limit of responsibility and the birth of the question: What do I have to do with justice? A question of consciousness. (OBBE 157)

When we return to a philosophy of consciousness and representation, the indispensable figure of the trace that Levinas has introduced becomes attenuated, if not suspect. As we have seen, in order to confront eventual skepticism about the trace, he enacts his witness in a literary here and now. His figural performance points not toward another world or to a being different from that discussed by Heidegger, so much as to the intensities and vulnerability of pre-conscious affectivity. By textually enacting the immediacy of suffering, Levinas appears to offer a poetics of the inexpressible (Anckaert 2020: 66–68). Nevertheless, since he also demands that we reflect on intersubjectivity from a standpoint outside the face-to-face encounter, his work gives us a double task: the as-if of his enacted here-and-now and the development of conceptualization. Justice similarly opens to the question, “what have I to do with justice?” and even to the representation of justice. To be sure, this two-sided justice entails an additional explanatory move that Levinas cannot make. This move would have to account for why third parties insist that “I” also receive just treatment. That is a question requiring the systems perspective, outside the now-moment in which “I” emerge and enact my witness, affectively invested by alterity (OBBE 158). “[I]t is only thanks to God that as a subject in incomparable with the other, I am approached as an other by the others, that is ‘for myself’” (OBBE 158, trans modified for fluency with the French).

The equalizing situation from which comparison, justice, and normativity can be deduced is thus beyond Levinas’ immediate concern (Herzog 2020, 42–44). Such a situation is that of objective, or third-person, consciousness. This is, for example, the approach adopted by Hegel in the Phenomenology of Spirit, which he calls the “for-us” as readers, or the externalist standpoint (Hegel PG §25). Levinas simply marks this standpoint, with his expression “thanks to God”, where it is already obvious that “God” is not a being. Although commentators differ on the interpretation of the phrase “thanks to God”, it is repeated in the liturgy, “Baruch haShem” or “Baruch atah Adonai (blessed be the Name or blessed be Adonai)”. Like other terms and expressions, Levinas “translates” the externalist standpoint into the language of prayer and liturgy. In his subsequent use of the expression, Levinas sets these words between quotation marks.

Franck interprets the 1974 figure of illeity as bespeaking the force and value of proximity. It is the sheer distance of a “God” that is never a being but “in whose trace the Thou or the face that intends and assigns me signifies” (Franck 2008: 109, my trans.). Marc Faessler ties the word “God” together with the Saying because it is the trace of an excess that Levinas also calls “glory (kavod)”. This maintains human practice as an open system: “the anarchy of God thus opens to a ‘saying God otherwise [Autrement dire Dieu]’” (Faessler 2021: 21).

When conceived spatially, illeity points to an indeterminate place or source, the other always already motivating my saying. Taking a further step, Levinas extends illeity to the possibility of my receiving justice from other people. He writes, “thanks to God [Il]…I am approached as an other by the others” (OBBE 158). But, again, even if universal justice is “thanks to God”, this God is not part of being (OBBE 162)—a claim familiar to both negative theology and to Maimonides’ approach to God through human action. Levinas is aware of the paradox of human justice being a gift from that which cannot be part of being, in which that justice nevertheless occurs. He knows the theological reversion to praxis toward which Maimonides gestures at the end of his Guide of the Perplexed: “The only positive knowledge of God of which man is capable is knowledge of the attributes of action” (Fagenblat 2010: 113),[47] and this is not ultimately knowledge. As Levinas puts it, “to know God is to know what must be done” (DF 17). It is thus not to know some being or even to erect a regulative idea (Froese 2020: 10). The dignity and force of illeity share an important connection with what we might call our enacting God through responsibility to the other and through justice. Another word for this is “holiness”, whether this comes from me in the form of the Saying or from the others as justice toward me.

Here lies the point at which a reading begins that bridges the philosophical and the religious dimensions of Levinas’ thought. Indeed, as he put it in his 1966 article “Infinity” (AT 53–76):

An entire strain of contemporary philosophy, setting out from the irreducibility of the interpersonal to relations of objectivity, thematization, and knowledge, is situated in the religious tradition of the idea of the infinite…even when it expresses itself in a deliberately and rigorously atheistic way. (AT 76, emph. added)

This suggests that, whether we approach it atheistically or religiously, the tension between interpersonal relations and objectivity implies the third party and by extension a social relationality that is indissociable from justice and politics. But it is not clear that Levinas ever decided whether politics implied above all war or the means toward a peaceable State. In his late essay “Peace and Proximity” (1984 [1996: 161–169]), Levinas expressed an attitude surprisingly favorable to the idea of the politics which, when the State is a liberal one, evinces palpable aspects of the trace of responsibility in its policies.

It is not without importance to know—and this is perhaps the European experience of the twentieth century—whether the egalitarian and just State [and its politics] in which the European is fulfilled…proceeds from a war of all against all—or from the irreducible responsibility of the one for the other. (in Rolland [ed.] 1984: 346, my trans.)

Jared Highlen (2021) develops a coherent argument on the basis of the distinction, introduced in the same 1984 article, between “the peace of the State” and a peace founded on separation—the separation-participation of the subject in its world but not reducible to it. Highlen, like Herzog, argues that, because the third looks at me through the eyes of the other, “politics is involved from the very beginning” (Highlen 2021: 326). With this claim, the face-to-face entails a measure of violence, by excluding other others for whom I may be responsible. But this violence is transitional, just as the violence of politics, which shows itself when “politics [is] left to itself” (2021: 328). Highlen concludes that on its own terms “the political appears not as the necessary…dilution of the ethical obligation, but rather as its fulfillment” (2021: 329). See Supplement S.6 on Politics and the State for further discussion

Herzog (2020) has recently strengthened this argument, urging that Levinas’ Talmudic readings provide the indispensable connection to what would be his politics. She points out that politics provide his proto-ethics with its visibility and with historic sites. Consequently, politics may be criticized in the name of responsibility, or ethics, but politics also moderates the radicality of ethical responsibility. Although Talmudic politics concerns Jewish communities, it often focuses on relations with other nations, as well as economic issues, from property disputes to equitable salaries. As Levinas himself observes,

the Rabbis cannot forget the organizing principle of Rome and its law [pluralism under Empire]! They therefore anticipate, with remarkable independence of spirit, modern political philosophy [including the philosophy of colonized states against imperial ones]. Whatever its order, the City already insures the rights of human beings against their fellow men. (BTV 183)

Key here are the words “whatever its order”. In the concept of order is already included a minimal protection of rights of human persons with regard to their fellows. This is a universal principle with specific instantiations in function of the State. We find such pluralism in the Talmud, which also carries the “secular” intuition that it is the human tribunal that should replace divine justice, which is not forthcoming (Herzog 2020: 44). That does not mean that Talmudic justice is not itself a collection of varied responses to what is a just action or law. Herzog nevertheless adds the insight that, in the Talmud,

politics is not defined by its modern philosophical attributes, it is neither a monopoly of power, nor the guardian of individuals’ natural rights, nor a natural expression of the people. [Politics] is defined [above all] as concern and care for the peoples’ hunger. (Herzog 2020: 40)

This neither denies the plurality of voices nor the potential universality of the singular in the Talmud. It emphasizes the “original peace”, or intersubjective responsibility that gives rise to good politics. To be sure, Levinas is aware that any “organized political order…can become unjust and even violent for its subjects” (Anckaert 2020: 72). This includes liberal orders based on contractualism. Again, Levinas is ultimately neither a liberal nor a conservative; insofar as Talmudic debate provides him material for a situated politics, the latter proves both pluralistic and context-dependent. See Supplement S.7 on Justice and the State for further discussion.

The dual preoccupation with justice, understood as righteousness, and justice understood as civic virtue, suggests that together Athens and Jerusalem give us a comprehensive approach to politics, as both practice and ideal. Drabinski and Fred Moten have questioned this claim to universality (Drabinski 2011: 165–196), and with it the category of “being-Jewish”, in favor of an emphasis on the passivity intrinsic to a multiplicity of human situations, including race, ethnicity, and gender. Yet, again, it is fair to argue that Levinas is primarily concerned with embodied passivity, which he approaches as a transcendental condition of possibility, as we have seen. Moten takes a different, Sartrean tack, emphasizing that passivity has multiple meanings. It is notably observed in our relations to things rather than to persons, thereby spontaneously diminishing their humanity. He adds that the Bible and the Greeks, when presented as “the whole world”, carry thought toward a teleological reflection that expresses an unacknowledged European malaise, wherein the non-European precisely receives the status of object (2018: 9, 11).

Mendel Kranz has recently traced Levinas’ relationship to this malaise, as also to the evolving Zionist project. He observes,

[W]hat these documents [studies] suggest, is that Levinas was simultaneously waging an ideological battle against the territorial and national codes of the Zionist project and attempting to articulate something of an alternative. (Kranz 2019: 316)

In a different vein, Ephraim Meir proposes a “trans-different” conversation between Gandhi and Levinas, acknowledging that the latter would not unequivocally embrace ahimse, non-violence—including in post-colonial situations. Meir cites Judith Butler’s Levinas-inspired claim that all lives should be seen as grievable (Butler 2020), which entails in its specific way a serious concern with human interdependence (Meir 2021: 10–12). See Supplement S.8 on Essays after Otherwise than Being.

3. Recent Developments: Humanism and Education

3.1 Humanism and Education

A unique feature of Levinas’ thought consists in his nuanced return to a humanism—“of the other person”. Extending his conception of humanism past what Levinas defined as its four-part nature—“respect for the person…; a blossoming of human nature, of intelligence in science, creativity in Art, and pleasure in daily life” (DF 277)—toward a Jewish humanism, Claire Katz raises the question of education. In her book, Levinas and the Crisis of Humanism, Katz discusses the multiple senses of this “other” humanism in light of the decline of classical (Christian) humanism, and given the challenges posed to it by both structuralism and poststructuralism. Following Levinas’ 1973 “Antihumanism and Education” (Levinas 1973 [DF 277–288]), Katz traces a dual genealogy, that of the loss of legitimacy of Western humanism as philosophy and ethos and that, in a sense more significant, of the demise of “social effectiveness and its intellectual meaning” (Katz 2013: 117).

Robin Podolsky has extended the question of an education in responsibility, to the creation in 2017 of “Sumud [steadfastness] Camp”. This site in the Hebron hills was conceived as a locus regrouping diaspora Jews, Israeli Jews, and Palestinians in a community designed as “a kind of Levinasian space” (Podolsky 2019: 1). As Podolsky emphasizes, such projects

are experiments in building a political program from the grass roots up, based on…investments in one another’s well-being that cross national and religious divides. Their praxis begins with the face-to-face. (2019: 3)

3.2 Levinas’ Philosophy and Enactivism

The term “enactivism” denotes developments in phenomenology and those cognitive sciences that together date largely from the work of Francesco Varela and Evan Thompson in the 1990s (1991, 2001). Indebted to the evolving reception of the work of the French philosopher Merleau-Ponty (1908–1961), enactivism conjoins phenomenology as first-person experience with third-person descriptions from the cognitive sciences. It accepts Heidegger and Merleau-Ponty’s conceptions of bodies being already in a world, their world. It takes seriously the existential quality of embodiment and has recently been interested in embodied intersubjectivity (Thompson 2001). Whereas many from the school of enactivism have approached the work of Levinas with skepticism (Koubová 2014; Di Paolo et al. 2018), deeming it dualistic and doubting that encounters with others might escape cognition and unfold at a purely affective level, enactivists have nevertheless not engaged Levinas extensively. One of the exceptions to this is Sarah Pawlett-Jackson (2021), who argues that singular experiences of the approach of the other—as can be found in both Sartre and Levinas—are insufficient to clarifying intersubjectivity among three or more people (Pawlett-Jackson 2021).

At the same time, Fabrice Métais and Mario Villalobos have countered that Levinas’ work can be instrumental in developing a bona fide enactivist, embodied ethics (Métais & Villalobos 2021, 2022). Close to the work of cognitivist, Tom Froese (2009), Métais and Villalobos argue that enactivism has fallen into the trap of a third-person intersubjectivity (2022: 327). The latter consists in focusing on intersubjectivity as a social aggregate, a site of shared existence invariably tied up with ontology or groups describable in neutral rather than ethical language. The authors define this as an approach to “distinctional otherness”—the way natural language speaks in the third-person of “the one and the other” as though they were objects (2022: 329). A different modality of otherness focuses on the second-person (thou, you), and thus on “the differences between agents or subjects” (2022: 329).

All these conceptions of otherness have value and find their use in enactivist cognitive science. Levinas’ philosophy offers a way to expand this approach. His conception of otherness is ethical, practical, and therefore “neither an ontological category nor an epistemic limitation in the realm of beings” (Métais & Villalobos 2022: 330). This distinction undergirds what enactivists call “participatory sense-making”, which include phenomena flowing from the face-to-face relation and networks of enactive agents. Their argument thus addresses Pawlett-Jackson’s objection concerning interconnected selves and others.

Considered together, Pawlett-Jackson, Métais and Villalobos arguably represent a new direction for enactivism, which has already shown important potential for self-correction and expansion. They argue that second-person perspectives on sociality are often presupposed even before the question of otherness arises, including in terms of ethics. This maintains alterity at one remove from the encounters that Levinas describes, and which come to light in the approach and call of another person. The upshot of more traditional enactivism is a horizontal conception of sociality, often limited to epistemic questions. As Métais and Villalobos see it,

the way they [enactivists] use the concept of irreducible otherness, as the otherness of the other subject, does not imply any modification of the process through which sense is produced (sense-making) and thus does not indicate any breach [of self-contained consciousness] beyond the sphere of constitution and ontology. (2022: 331)

As indicated, this concept of otherness overlooks the ethical dimension of sense-making, which arises, for Levinas, in the immediate encounter with an other, who is both embodied and carries their own perspective. Métais and Villalobos argue that enactivists have treated the pair, knowability and unknowability, in light of a more conventional object- versus subject-otherness.

4. Concluding Remarks

Commentators have differed on the comparative importance of Levinas’ major works, Totality and Infinity and Otherwise than Being. Some have urged that we see in them two sides of a single coin: that of responsibility experienced in the face-to-face encounter and that of the insistence of an affective trace that interrupts flowing time as conceived by classical phenomenology (Peperzak 1993: 7). Other commentators have argued that Otherwise than Being is Levinas’ magnum opus,[48] a study on the relational pre-conditions of language indebted to, yet diverging from, Heidegger’s investigations of the poetic logos (Heidegger 1936–1968 [2000: 59–64]). As we have seen, Derrida called Totality and Infinity a “treatise on hospitality” (see §2.4.1, supra) and devoted, in sum, more attention to it than to Otherwise than Being, although the latter work was in part a response to Derrida’s criticisms in “Violence and Metaphysics” (Derrida 1964 [1978]). It remains that Otherwise than Being reprises elements of Levinas’ early research into metaphor as the performative basis of language, as well as his engagement with Merleau-Ponty’s cultural significations, both of which are responsible for a distinct conception of existence. For Levinas, beneath cultures and significations, there remains a trace of a non-relative meaning (sens), which includes “the absoluteness of the presence of the other” (Levinas 1964 [1987b: 106]).

In this regard, the publication of Totality and Infinity was followed closely by two essays. A talk intitled “La métaphore” presented at Jean Wahl’s Collège philosophique, dates from February 1962.[49] The article “Meaning and Sense” (La signification et le sens) first appeared in 1964 (Levinas 1964). As much as the latter article placed Heidegger’s fundamental ontology within historically specific cultures and privileged “sense” over being, “La métaphore” returned to a Maimonidean conception of human language as allegory and expressing more than the words said therein. Given these preparations, there is little question that the novelty of Otherwise than Being lies in its three innovations: (1) the tropes (metaphors) for transcendence-in-immanence (i.e., recurrence, proximity, obsession, persecution, and substitution); (2) the deconstruction of language understood as the site in which existence is stated as an address-, and (3) Levinas’ “wager” of stepping out of philosophical reasoning to envision a trace encountered in a performative register that both “says” and “unsays” itself by turns (OBBE 167).

Despite these innovations, Levinas’ philosophical project remains largely constant: to rethink the meaning of existence in terms of the transcendence of the other and its meaning for ethics. To that end, he consistently revisited Husserl’s phenomenological method. He reconceived Heidegger’s ontological difference as an irreducible separation between being and the good we enact. He had extensive, often undeclared recourse to the profound, anti-totalizing intuitions of religious life, as found in Rosenzweig’s new thinking and indirectly in Maimonides’ apophaticism. By reason of his opposition to systems-thought, Levinas never adhered uncritically to any one philosophy.

A common thread runs through his philosophy and his Talmudic readings. Transcendence is one of his words for the spontaneity of responsibility for another person. Responsibility is experienced in concrete life and is variously expressed, from words like “here I am” to apologies and self-accounting. This is the case, Levinas argues, even before a de facto command is heard or reflected upon. This surprising proposition hearkens to the debated meaning of Jews “receiving the Torah before knowing what was written in it” (NTR 42–43). Levinas names this responsiveness Platonically, as the “Good beyond being”. We perform that good, that trace of the infinite, because instances of answering to or for another are everyday events, even though they do not appear typical of self-interested behaviors.

Above all, we do not choose to be responsible. Responsibility arises as if elicited, before we begin to think about it, by the approach of the other person. Because this theme is found in his philosophy as well as in his interpretations of Talmudic passages, Levinas’ thought has, at times, left both Talmud scholars and philosophers dissatisfied. For some Talmudists, his thought seems secularly humanistic, with “infinity” suggesting a clandestine concept of divinity. No stranger to Mishnah and Gemara (Talmud), his interpretations are less preoccupied with traditional inter- and intra-textuality than with the ethical content of the teachings therein. To philosophers skeptical of him, Levinas’ thought reinterprets Heidegger’s in-the-world facticity in a metaphysical vein. Indeed, its anti-foundationalist approach to responsibility, as the pre-reflective structure of the embodied, relational “self” (soi), appears to these critics to move inconsistently between phenomenology and religious thought, despite its lack of dogmatic commitments. As we have seen, in his later philosophy, the seemingly metaphysical concept of illeity expresses my emotive experience of an affective excess greater than that which I can contain. In this way, it also resembles Descartes’ “light so resplendent” (Med. III [1911: 171]). But it is precisely in these tensions, between the Jewish religious and philosophical traditions, on the one hand, and his phenomenological-existential thinking-of-the-other, on the other hand, that Levinas’ originality lies.

Bibliography

A. Works by Levinas

A.1 Cited Works by Levinas

[TOI]

La théorie de l’intuition dans la phénoménologie de Husserl, Paris: Vrin, 1970. Levinas’ doctoral dissertation, first published in 1930;

The Theory of Intuition in Husserl’s Phenomenology, second edition, André Orianne (trans.), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1995. First edition in 1975. Page numbers from the 1995 English edition.

[RPH]

“Quelques réflexions sur la philosophie de l’Hitlérisme”, Esprit, 1934, 3(26): 199–208. Collected in Quelques réflexions sur la philosophie de l’hitlérisme, Miguel Abensour (ed.), Paris: Rivages, 1997.

“Reflections on the Philosophy of Hitlerism”, Seán Hand (trans.), Critical Inquiry, 1990, 17(1): 63–71. doi:10.1086/448574

[OE]

De l’évasion (Essais), notes by Jacques Rolland, Paris: Fata Morgana, 1982. First published in 1935 in Recherches philosophiques.

On Escape / De l’évasion, Bettina Bergo (trans.), Stanford: Stanford University Press, 2003.

[EE]

De l’existence à l’existant, second edition, Paris: Vrin, 1986. First published in 1947.

Existence and Existents, Alphonso Lingis (trans.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1978.

[TO]

Le temps et l’autre, Montpellier: Fata Morgana, 1979. First published in Jean Wahl (ed.) Le choix, le monde, l’existence, Grenoble: Arthaud, 1947.

Time and the Other: and Other Esssays, Richard A. Cohen (trans.), Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press, 1987.

[EDE]

En découvrant l’existence avec Husserl et Heidegger. Reprinted with new essays, Paris: Vrin, 1982. First published in 1949. Includes

  • “L’œuvre d’Edmond Husserl”. First published in, 1940, Revue Philosophique de la France et de l’Étranger, 129(1/2): 33–85. Translated as “The Work of Edmund Husserl” in DEH 47–89.
  • “Martin Heidegger et l’ontologie” (Martin Heidegger and Ontology). First published in, 1932, Revue Philosophique de la France et de l’Étranger, 113: 395–431.
  • “Intentionalité et Sensation”, first published in, 1965, Revue Internationale de Philosophie, 19(71/72 (1/2)): 34–54. In the 1982 edition only. Translated as “Intentionality and Sensation” in DEH 135–150.
[DEH]

Discovering Existence with Husserl. Richard A. Cohen and Michael B. Smith (trans), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1998.

[TI]

Totalité et Infini: Essais sur l’Extériorité (Phænomenologica 8), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1961.

Totality and Infinity: An Essay on Exteriority (Duquesne Studies. Philosophical Series 24), Alphonso Lingis (trans.), Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press, 1969.

[DF]

Difficile liberté: Essais sur le judaïsme, third edition revised, Paris: Éditions Albin Michel, 1976. First published in 1963.

Difficult Freedom: Essays on Judaism, Seán Hand (trans.), London: Athlone, 1990.

[NTR]

Quatre lectures talmudiques, Paris: Les Éditions de Minuit, 1968.

Du sacré au saint: cinq nouvelles lectures talmudiques, Paris: Les Éditions de Minuit, 1977.

Nine Talmudic Readings, Annette Aronowicz (trans.), Bloomington: Indiana University Press, 1990. This translation regroups readings between 1968 and 1977.

[OBBE]

Autrement qu’être; ou, au-delà de l’essence (Phaenomenologica 54), La Haye: Martinus Nijhoff, 1974. Second edition, 1978.

Otherwise than Being: Or, Beyond Essence (Martinus Nijhoff Philosophy Texts 3), Alphonso Lingis (trans.), Dordrecht/Boston/London: Kluwer, 1981.

[BTV]

L’au-delà du verset: lectures et discours talmudiques, Paris: Éditions de Minuit, 1982.

Beyond the Verse: Talmudic Readings and Lectures, Gary D. Mole (trans.), London: Athlone Press, 1994.

[OGCM]

De Dieu qui vient à l’idée, second edition corrected and enlarged, Paris: Vrin, 1986. First published in 1982.

Of God Who Comes to Mind (Meridian, Crossing Aesthetics), Bettina Bergo (trans.), Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 1998.

[EI]

Éthique et infini: Dialogues avec Philippe Nemo, Paris: France Culture Radio broadcast, 1982. Paris: Livre de Poche, 1982.

Ethics and Infinity, Richard A. Cohen (trans.), Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press, 1985.

[TEI]

Transcendance et intelligibilité: Suivi d’un entretien (Lieux théologiques), Genève: Labor et Fides, 1984.

“Transcendance and Intelligibility”, Simon Critchley and Tamra Wright (trans), in Peperzak, Critchley, and Bernasconi 1996: 149–160 (ch. 9).

[ITN]

À l’heure des nations, Paris: Les Éditions de Minuit, 1988.

In the Time of the Nations, Michael B. Smith (trans.), London: Athlone Press, 1994.

[EN]

Entre Nous: Essais sur le penser-à-l’autre. Paris: Éditions Bernard Grasset, 1991.

Entre Nous: On Thinking-of-the-Other (European Perspectives), Michael B. Smith and Barbara Harshav (trans), New York: Columbia University Press, 1998.

[AT]

Altérité et transcendance, Saint-Clément-de-Rivière: Fata Morgana, 1995.

Alterity and Transcendence, Michael B. Smith (trans.), New York: Columbia University Press, 1999.

[LO1]

Levinas Œuvres I: Carnets de captivité et autres écrits, Rodolphe Calin and Catherine Chalier (eds), Paris: Grasset, 2009.

[LO2]

Levinas Œuvres II: Parole et silence et autres conférences inédites au Collège philosophique, Rodolphe Calin (ed.) Paris: Grasset, 2009.

  • Levinas, Emmanuel, 1935, “L’actualité de Maïmonide”, Paix et Droit (journal of the Alliance Israëlite Universelle), 1935(4/April): 6–7. Republished in Cahiers de l’Herne: Levinas, Catherine Chalier and Miguel Abensour (eds), Paris: Éditions de l’Herne, 1991.
  • –––, 1964 [1987], “La signification et le sens”, Revue de Métaphysique et de Morale, 69(2): 125–156. Republished in Humanisme de l’autre homme.Translated as Meaning and Sense in Lingis 1987: 75-108.
  • –––, 1973, “Antihumanisme et éducation”, Bulletin intérieur du Consistoire Central des Israélites de France, 1973(2): 17–28. Translated as “Antihumanism and Education”, in DF 277–288.
  • –––, 1979, “Les villes-refuges”. Translated as “Cities of Refuge”. Collected in BTV 51–70 [34–52].
  • –––, 1984 [1996], “Paix et proximité” in Les cahiers de la nuit surveillée, 1984(3): 339–346. Translated as “Peace and Proximity”, Peter Atterton and Simon Critchley (trans), in Peperzak, Critchley, and Bernasconi 1996: 162–169 (ch. 10).
  • –––, 2008, “The Contemporary Relevance of Maimonides (1935)”, Michael Fagenblat (trans.), The Journal of Jewish Thought and Philosophy, 16(1): 91–94. doi:10.1163/105369908785822142

A.2 Other Philosophical Works by Levinas

  • Sur Maurice Blanchot. Montpellier: Fata Morgana, 1976. Translated in Proper Names, Michael B. Smith (trans.), London: Athlone Press, 1996.
  • Levinas Œuvres III: Éros, littérature et philosophie, Jean-Luc Nancy et Danielle Cohen-Levinas (eds), Paris: Grasset, 2013.
  • Levinas Œuvres IV: Dossier Totalité et infini inédits, Dan Arbib et Danielle Cohen-Levinas (eds), Paris: Grasset, 2024.

A.3 Collections of Philosophical Essays and Lectures

  • Humanisme de l’autre Homme (Essais 6), Montpellier: Fata Morgana, 1972. Translated as Humanism of the Other, Nidra Poller (trans.), introduction by Richard A. Cohen, Urbana, IL: University of Illinois Press, 2003.
  • “Jean Wahl sans avoir ni être”, in Jean Wahl et Gabriel Marcel (Bibliotheque des Archives de philosophie, nouv. ser., 21), by Emmanuel Lévinas, Xavier Tilliette, and Paul Ricœur, Paris: Beauchesne, 1976.
  • Noms Propres: Agnon, Buber, Celan, Delhomme, Derrida, Jabès, Kierkegaard, Lacroix, Laporte, Picard, Proust, Van Breda, Wahl (Essais), Montpellier: Fata Morgana, 1976. Translated as Proper Names, Michael B. Smith (trans.), London: Athlone Press, 1996.
  • Hors Sujet, Paris: Fata Morgana, 1987a. Translated as Outside the Subject, Michael B. Smith (trans.), London: Athlone Press, 1993.
  • De l’oblitération: entretien avec Françoise Armengaud à propos de l’œuvre de Sosno (Le Miroir oblique), Paris: Editions de la Différence, 1990. Republished in 1998. Translated as On Obliteration: An Interview with Françoise Armengaud Concerning the Work of Sacha Sosno (Think Art), Richard A. Cohen (trans.), Zurich/Berlin: DIAPHANES, 2019.
  • La mort et le temps, Paris: Éditions de l’Herne, 1991. Lectures presented 1975–76.
  • Dieu, La Mort et Le Temps, Jacques Rolland (ed.), Paris: Bernard Grasset, 1993. Translated as God, Death, and Time (Meridian), Bettina Bergo (trans.), preface by Jacques Rolland, Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 2000.
  • Les imprévus de l’histoire, preface by Pierre Hayat, Saint-Clément-la-Rivière: Fata Morgana, 1994. Translated as Unforeseen History, Nidra Poller (trans.), introduction by Richard A. Cohen, foreword by Don Ihde, Urbana, IL: University of Illinois Press, 2004.
  • Liberté et commandement, preface by Pierre Hayat, Montpellier: Fata Morgana, 1994.
  • Ethique comme philosophie première (Rivages poche/petite bibliothèque 254), Jacques Rolland (ed.), Paris: Payot & Rivages, 1998.

A.4 Other Talmudic Writings and Studies on Judaism by Levinas

  • Nouvelles lectures talmudiques, Paris: Les Éditions de Minuit, 1995. New Talmudic Readings, Richard A. Cohen (trans.), Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press, 1999.
  • L’au-delà du verset: lectures et discours talmudiques (Collection Critique), Paris: Éditions de minuit, 1982. Beyond the Verse: Talmudic Readings and Lectures, Gary D. Mole (trans.), London: Athlone Press, 1994.

A.5 Other Collections of Works by Levinas in English

  • Hand, Seán (ed.), 1989, The Levinas Reader, Oxford/Cambridge, MA: B. Blackwell.
  • Lingis, Alphonso (trans.), 1987b, Collected Philosophical Papers (Phaenomenologica 100), Dordrecht/Boston: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • Peperzak, Adriaan Theodoor, Simon Critchley, and Robert Bernasconi (eds), 1996, Emmanuel Levinas: Basic Philosophical Writings (Studies in Continental Thought), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Robbins, Jill (ed.), 2001, Is It Righteous to Be? Interviews with Emmanuel Lévinas (Meridian), Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.

B. Cited Works by Major Philosophical Influences

[Med.]
Descartes, René, 1641 [1911], Meditationes de prima philosophia, Paris: Michel Soly. Translated as “Meditations on First Philosophy”, in The Philosophical Works of Descartes, Volume 1, Elizabeth Sanderson Haldane and G. R. T. Ross (trans), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 131–200.
[PG]
Hegel, Georg Wilhelm Friedrich, 1807 [1977], Phänomenologie des Geistes, Bamberg und Würzburg: Goebbardt. Translated as Phenomenology of Spirit, Arnold V. Miller (trans.), Oxford: Clarendon Press, 1977.
[BT]
Heidegger, Martin, 1927, Sein und Zeit, Halle: M. Niemeyer. Seventh edition (1946) translated as Being and Time, John Macquarrie and Edward Robinson (trans), New York: Harper, 1962. Page numbers from the 1962 translation.
[CM]
Husserl, Edmund, Cartesianische Meditationen eine Einleitung in die Phänomenologie (Husserliana 1). Based on 2 lectures delivered at the Sorbonne in 1929, translated as Cartesian Meditations: An Introduction to Phenomenology, Dorion Cairns (trans.), The Hague: M. Nijhoff, 1960. Reprinted 1973. Note: Husserliana refers to the text critical edition of Husserl’s work and is cited with volume numbers.
[GDP]
–––, Grenzprobleme des Phänomenologie: Analysen des Unbewusstseins und der Instinkte; Metaphysik; Späte Ethik (Texte aus dem Nachlass, 1908–1937) (Husserliana 42), Rochus Sowa and Thomas Vongehr (eds) Dordrecht: Springer, 2014. doi:10.1007/978-94-007-6801-7
[Ideas I]
–––, Ideen zu einer reinen Phänomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie, Erstes Buch: Allgemeine Einführung in die reine Phänomenologie, Tübingen: Niemeyer, 1913. Collected in Husserliana 2. Translated as Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy—First Book: General Introduction to a Pure Phenomenology, Fred Kersten (trans.), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1982.
[Ideas II]
–––. Ideen zu einer reinen Phänomenologie und phänomenologischen Philosophie. Zweites Buch: Phänomenologische Untersuchungen zur Konstitution (Husserliana 4), Marly Biemel (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff, 1952 [Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1991]. Unpublished in Husserl’s lifetime. Translated as Ideas Pertaining to a Pure Phenomenology and to a Phenomenological Philosophy—Second Book: Studies in the Phenomenology of Constitution, Richard Rojcewiz and André Schuwer (trans), Dordrecht: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 1989.
[PCIT]
–––, Zur Phänomenologie des inneren Zeitbewusstseins (1893–1917) (Husserliana 10), Rudolf Boehm (ed.), 1969. Translated as On the Phenomenology of the Consciousness of Internal Time (1893–1917), John Barnett Brough (trans.), Dordrecht: Kluwer, 1991.
[APS]
–––, 1966 [2001], Analysen zur passiven Synthesis: Aus Vorlesungs- und Forschungsmanuskripten 1918–1926 (Husserliana 11), H. L. van Breda (ed.), Den Haag: M. Nijhoff, 1966. Translated as Analyses Concerning Passive and Active Synthesis: Lectures on Transcendental Logic (Edmund Husserl Collected Works 9), Anthony J. Steinbeck (trans.), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers, 2001.
[KPV]
Kant, Immanuel, 1788 [2002], Kritik der praktischen Vernunft, Riga: Hartknoch. Akademie Ausgabe [AA] 5: 1–164. Translated as Critique of Practical Reason, Werner S. Pluhar (trans.), Indianapolis/Cambridge: Hackett, 2002.
[PP]
Merleau-Ponty, Maurice, 1945 [2012], Phénoménologie de la perception (Bibliothèque des idées), Paris: Gallimard. Translated as Phenomenology of Perception, Donald A. Landes (trans.), London/New York: Routledge, 2012. doi:10.4324/9780203720714
[SE]
Rosenzweig, Franz, 1921 [2005], Der Stern der Erlösung, Frankfurt am Main: J. Kauffmann. Translated as The Star of Redemption (Modern Jewish Philosophy and Religion. Translations and Critical Studies), Barbara E. Galli (trans.), Madison, WI: University of Wisconsin Press, 2001.
[EN]
Sartre, Jean-Paul, 1943 [1992], L’être et le néant: essai d’ontologie phénoménologique (Bibliothèque des idées), Paris: Gallimard. Translated as Being and Nothingness: An Essay on Phenomenological Ontology, Hazel E. Barnes (trans.), New York: Philosophical Library, 1956. Reprinted New York: Washington Square Press/Pocket Books, 1992.

C. Secondary Literature

C.1 Monographs on Levinas

  • Ajzenstat [Eisenstadt], Oona, 2001, Driven Back to the Text: The Premodern Sources of Levinas’ Postmodernism, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Alford, C. Fred, 2002, Levinas, the Frankfurt School, and Psychoanalysis (Disseminations), Middletown, CT: Wesleyan University Press.
  • Allen, Sarah, 2009, The Philosophical Sense of Transcendence: Levinas and Plato on Loving beyond Being, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Arnett, Ronald C., 2017, Levinas’s Rhetorical Demand: The Unending Obligation of Communication Ethics, Carbondale, IL: Southern Illinois University Press.
  • Awerkamp, Don, 1977, Emmanuel Levinas: Ethics and Politics (Studies in Modern Philosophy), New York: Revisionist Press.
  • Bailhache, Gérard, 1994, Le sujet chez Emmanuel Levinas: fragilité et subjectivité (Philosophie d’aujourd’hui), Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Banon, David, 2022, De l’être à la lettre: philosophie et judaïsme dans l’œuvre d’Emmanuel Levinas (Collection “Le bel aujourd’hui”), Paris: Hermann.
  • Basterra, Gabriela, 2015, The Subject of Freedom: Kant, Levinas, New York: Fordham University Press. doi:10.5422/fordham/9780823265145.001.0001
  • Batnitzky, Leora, 2006, Leo Strauss and Emmanuel Levinas: Philosophy and the Politics of Revelation, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511499050
  • Bauman, Zygmunt, 1993, Postmodern Ethics, Oxford/Cambridge, MA: Blackwell Publishers.
  • Benso, Silvia, 2000, The Face of Things: A Different Side of Ethics (SUNY Series in Contemporary Continental Philosophy), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Bensussan, Gérard, 2008, Éthique et expérience: Levinas politique (Philosophie, d’autre part), Strasbourg: Phocide.
  • Bergo, Bettina, 1999, Levinas between Ethics and Politics: For the Beauty That Adorns the Earth (Phaenomenologica 152), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic. doi:10.1007/978-94-017-2077-9
  • –––, 2025, Emmanual Levinas: Essays on Phenomenology, Hermeneutics, and Jewish Thought (Supplements to The Journal of Jewish Thought and Philosophy, 40), Leiden: Brill Publishers.
  • Bloechl, Jeffrey, 2000, Liturgy of the Neighbor: Emmanuel Levinas and the Religion of Responsibility, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • –––, 2022, Levinas and the Primacy of the Ethical: Philosophy as Prophecy, Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Botwinick, Aryeh, 2014, Emmanuel Lévinas and the Limits to Ethics: A Critique and a Re-Appropriation (Routledge Jewish Studies Series), London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781315879918
  • Brezis, David, 2012, Levinas et le tournant sacrificiel (Le Bel aujourd’hui), Paris: Hermann.
  • Burggraeve, Roger, 1985, From Self-Development to Solidarity: An Ethical Reading of Human Desire in Its Socio-Political Relevance According to Emmanuel Levinas, Leuven: Peeters.
  • –––, 1990 [2002], Levinas over vrede en mensenrechten: met vier essays van Emmanuel Levinas vertaald door Gertrude Schellens, Leuven: Acco. Translated as The Wisdom of Love in the Service of Love: Emmanuel Levinas on Justice, Peace, and Human Rights (Marquette Studies in Philosophy 29), Jeffrey Bloechl (trans.), Milwaukee: Marquette University Press, 2002.
  • Calin, Rodolphe and François-David Sebbah, 2002, Le vocabulaire de Lévinas, Paris: Ellipses.
  • Caputo, John D., 1993, Against Ethics: Contributions to a Poetics of Obligation with Constant Reference to Deconstruction (Studies in Continental Thought), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Caygill, Howard, 2002, Levinas and the Political (Thinking the Political), London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203994573
  • Cederberg, Carl, 2010, Resaying the Human: Levinas beyond Humanism and Antihumanism, PhD thesis, Södertörn, (Sweden): Södertörns högskola.
  • Chalier, Catherine, 1982, Judaïsme et Altérité (Collection “Les Dix Paroles”), Lagrasse: Verdier.
  • –––, 1987, La persévérance du mal (Nuit surveillée), Paris: Editions du Cerf.
  • –––, 1993, Lévinas: l’utopie de l’humain (Présence du judaïsme), Paris: Éditions Albin Michel.
  • –––, 1998 [2002], Pour une morale au-delà du savoir: Kant et Levinas (Bibliothèque Albin Michel idées), Paris: Albin Michel. Translated as What Ought I to Do? Morality in Kant and Levinas, Jane Marie Todd (trans.), Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 2002.
  • –––, 2002, La trace de l’infini: Emmanuel Levinas et la source hébraïque (Philosophie & théologie), Paris: Cerf.
  • Champagne, Roland A., 1998, The Ethics of Reading According to Emmanuel Levinas (Chiasma 7), Amsterdam: Rodopi.
  • Chanter, Tina, 2001, Time, Death, and the Feminine: Levinas with Heidegger, Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
  • Ciaramelli, Fabio, 1989, Transcendance et éthique: essai sur Lévinas, Brussels: Éditions Ousia.
  • Coe, Cynthia D., 2018, Levinas and the Trauma of Responsibility: The Ethical Significance of Time (Studies in Continental Thought), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Cohen, Richard A., 1994, Elevations: The Height of the Good in Rosenzweig and Lévinas (Chicago Studies in the History of Judaism), Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • –––, 2001, Ethics, Exegesis, and Philosophy: Interpretation after Levinas, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511488238
  • –––, 2016, Out of Control: Confrontations between Spinoza and Levinas (SUNY Series in Contemporary Jewish Thought), New York: State University of New York Press.
  • Craig, Megan, 2010, Levinas and James: Toward a Pragmatic Phenomenology (American Philosophy), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Critchley, Simon, 1992, The Ethics of Deconstruction: Derrida and Levinas, Oxford/Cambridge, MA: Blackwell. Second edition, Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press, 1999.
  • –––, 1999a, Ethics, Politics, Subjectivity: Essays on Derrida, Levinas and Contemporary French Thought, London/New York: Verso.
  • –––, 2015, The Problem with Levinas, Alexis Dianda (ed.), Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780198738763.001.0001
  • Davis, Colin, 1996, Levinas: An Introduction, Notre Dame, IN: University of Notre Dame Press.
  • De Bauw, Christine, 1997, L’envers du sujet: Lire autrement Emmanuel Levinas, Paris: Vrin, Éditions Ousia.
  • De Boer, Theo, 1997, The Rationality of Transcendence: Studies in the Philosophy of Emmanuel Levinas (Amsterdam Studies in Jewish Thought 4), Amsterdam: J.C. Gieben.
  • De Vries, Hent, 1989 [2005], Theologie im pianissimo: Zur Aktualität der Denkfiguren Adornos und Levinas (Studies in philosophical theology), Kampen: J.H. Kok. Translated as Minimal Theologies: Critiques of Secular Reason in Adorno and Levinas, Geoffrey Hale (trans.), Baltimore: Johns Hopkins University Press, 2005. doi:10.1353/book.72145
  • Derrida, Jacques, 1997 [1999], Adieu à Emmanuel Lévinas (Incises), Paris: Galilée. Translated as Adieu to Emmanuel Levinas (Meridian, Crossing Aesthetics), Pascale-Anne Brault and Michael Naas (trans), Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 1999.
  • Diprose, Rosalyn, 2002, Corporeal Generosity: On Giving with Nietzsche, Merleau-Ponty, and Levinas (SUNY Series in Gender Theory), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Drabinski, John E., 2001, Sensibility and Singularity: The Problem of Phenomenology in Levinas (SUNY Series in Contemporary Continental Philosophy), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • –––, 2011, Levinas and the Postcolonial: Race, Nation, Other, Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press.
  • Dudiak, Jeffrey, 2001, The Intrigue of Ethics: A Reading of the Idea of Discourse in the Thought of Emmanuel Lévinas (Perspectives in Continental Philosophy, 18), New York: Fordham University Press. doi:10.5422/fso/9780823220922.001.0001
  • Duncan, Diane Moira, 2001, The Pre-Text of Ethics: On Derrida and Levinas (Studies in Theoretical and Applied Ethics 4), New York: Peter Lang.
  • Eaglestone, Robert, 1997, Ethical Criticism: Reading after Levinas, Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press.
  • Eskin, Michael, 2000, Ethics and Dialogue: In the Works of Levinas, Bakhtin, Mandel’shtam, and Celan, New York: Oxford University Press. doi:10.1093/oso/9780198159926.001.0001
  • Faessler, Marc, 2021, L’anarchie de Dieu: dans les pas d’Emmanuel Levinas (Collection “Le bel aujourd’hui”), Paris: Hermann.
  • Fagenblat, Michael, 2010, A Covenant of Creatures: Levinas’s Philosophy of Judaism (Cultural Memory in the Present), Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
  • Feron, Etienne, 1992, De l’idée de transcendance à la question du langage: l’itinéraire philosophique de Levinas (Collection Krisis), Grenoble: Éditions Jérôme Millon.
  • Finkielkraut, Alain, 1984, La sagesse de l’amour: essai, Paris: Gallimard.
  • Forthomme, Bernard, 1979, Une philosophie de la transcendance: la métaphysique d’Emmanuel Lévinas, Paris: Pensée universelle.
  • Forthomme, Bernard and Jad Hatem, 1996, Affectivité et altérité selon Lévinas et Henry, Paris: Cariscript.
  • Franck, Didier, 2008, L’un-pour-l’autre: Levinas et la signification (Epiméthée), Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Frost, Tom, 2022, Law, Relationality and the Ethical Life: Agamben and Levinas (Law and Politics: Continental Perspectives), Abingdon/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781315191447
  • Fryer, David Ross, 2020, Intervention of the Other, New York: Other Press.
  • Gaston, Sean, 2005, Derrida and Disinterest (Continuum Studies in Continental Philosophy), London/New York: Continuum. doi:10.5040/9781472546364
  • Gauthier, David J., 2011, Martin Heidegger, Emmanuel Levinas, and the Politics of Dwelling, Lanham, MD: Lexington Books.
  • Gibbs, Robert, 1992, Correlations in Rosenzweig and Levinas, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • –––, 2000, Why Ethics? Signs of Responsibilities, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Goldwyn, Elisabeth, 2011 [2015], Reṿaḥ Ben Ha-Otiyot: Shiʻuraṿ Ha-Talmudiyim Shel Leṿinas, Hatʼamah Ben Tsurah Ṿe-Tokhen (Sifriyat “Helal Ben-Ḥayim”. Le-Madaʻe Ha-Yahadut), Bene Beraḳ: ha-Ḳibuts ha-meʼuḥad. Translated as Reading between the Lines: Form and Content in Levinas’s Talmudic Readings, Rachel Kessel (trans.), Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press, 2015.
  • Guenther, Lisa, 2006, The Gift of the Other: Levinas and the Politics of Reproduction (SUNY Series in Gender Theory), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Guibal, Francis and Stanislas Breton (eds), 1986, Altérités: Jacques Derrida et Pierre-Jean Labarrière, Paris: Éditions Osiris.
  • Habib, Stéphane, 1998, La responsabilité chez Sartre et Lévinas (Collection L’ouverture philosophique), Paris: L’Harmattan.
  • –––, 2005, Levinas et Rosenzweig: philosophies de la révélation (Philosophie d’aujourd’hui), Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Hammerschlag, Sarah, 2010, The Figural Jew: Politics and Identity in Postwar French Thought (Religion and Postmodernism), Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • –––, 2016, Broken Tablets: Levinas, Derrida, and the Literary Afterlife of Religion, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Hand, Seán, 2009, Emmanuel Levinas (Routledge Critical Thinkers), London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203888056
  • Handelman, Susan A., 1991, Fragments of Redemption: Jewish Thought and Literary Theory in Benjamin, Scholem, and Levinas (Jewish Literature and Culture), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Hayat, Pierre, 1995, Emmanuel Levinas, éthique et société (Collection Philosophie, épistémologie), Paris: Editions Kimé.
  • –––, 1997, Individualisme éthique et philosophie chez Levinas (Collection Philosophie, épistémologie), Paris: Editions Kimé.
  • Hendley, Steve, 2000, From Communicative Action to the Face of the Other: Levinas and Habermas on Language, Obligation, and Community, Lanham, MD: Lexington Books.
  • Herzog, Annabel, 2020, Levinas’s Politics: Justice, Mercy, Universality (Haney Foundation Series), Philadelphia: University of Pennsylvania Press. doi:10.9783/9780812296808
  • Hutchens, Benjamin C., 2004, Levinas: A Guide for the Perplexed, New York/London: Continuum.
  • Hyde, Michael J., 2001, The Call of Conscience: Heidegger and Levinas: Rhetoric and the Euthanasia Debate (Studies in Rhetoric/Communication), Columbia, SC: University of South Carolina Press.
  • Katz, Claire Elise, 2003, Levinas, Judaism, and the Feminine: The Silent Footsteps of Rebecca (Indiana Series in the Philosophy of Religion), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Kavka, Martin, 2004, Jewish Messianism and the History of Philosophy, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511499098
  • Kayser, Paulette, 2000, Emmanuel Levinas: la trace du féminin (Philosophie d’aujourd’hui), Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Kearney, Richard, 1984, Dialogues with Contemporary Continental Thinkers: The Phenomenological Heritage: Paul Ricoeur, Emmanuel Levinas, Herbert Marcuse, Stanislas Breton, Jacques Derrida, Manchester, UK/Dover, NH: Manchester University Press.
  • Keenan, Dennis King, 1999, Death and Responsibility: The “Work” of Levinas (SUNY Series in Contemporary Continental Philosophy), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Kenaan, Hagi, 2012, Visage(s): une autre éthique du regard après Levinas (Philosophie imaginaire), Colette Salem (trans.), Paris: Éditions de l’Éclat.
  • Kleinberg, Ethan, 2021, Emmanuel Levinas’s Talmudic Turn: Philosophy and Jewish Thought (Cultural Memory in the Present), Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
  • Kosky, Jeffrey L., 2001, Levinas and the Philosophy of Religion (Indiana Series in the Philosophy of Religion), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Krewani, Wolfgang Nikolaus, 1992, Emmanuel Lévinas: Denker des Anderen (Kolleg Philosophie), Freiburg (Breisgau): Alber.
  • Kunz, George, 1998, The Paradox of Power and Weakness: Levinas and an Alternative Paradigm for Psychology (SUNY Series, Alternatives in Psychology), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Large, William, 2015, Levinas’ ‘Totality and Infinity’ (Reader’s Guides), London: Bloomsbury Academic.
  • Laruelle, François, 1986, Les philosophies de la diffʹerence: introduction critique (Philosophie d’aujourd’hui), Paris: Presses Universitaires de France.
  • Lazaroff, Alan, 2002, Nietzsche, Buber, Levinas: Judaism as Relational Religion (Occasional Papers in Jewish History and Thought, 23),, New York: Hunter College of the City University of New York / Temple Israel.
  • Lescourret, Marie-Anne, 1994, Emmanuel Levinas, Paris: Flammarion.
  • Llewelyn, John, 1991, The Middle Voice of Ecological Conscience: A Chiasmic Reading of Responsibility in the Neighbourhood of Levinas, Heidegger, and Others, New York: St. Martin’s Press.
  • –––, 1995, Emmanuel Levinas: The Genealogy of Ethics (Warwick Studies in European Philosophy), New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203426821
  • –––, 2000, The Hypocritical Imagination: Between Kant and Levinas (Warwick Studies in European Philosophy), New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203187777
  • –––, 2002, Appositions of Jacques Derrida and Emmanuel Levinas (Studies in Continental Thought), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Libertson, Joseph, 1982, Proximity, Levinas, Blanchot, Bataille, and Communication (Phaenomenologica 87), The Hague/Boston: M. Nijhoff.
  • Malka, Salomon, 2002, Emmanuel Lévinas: la vie et la trace, Paris: JC Lattès.
  • Manning, Robert John Sheffler, 1993, Interpreting Otherwise than Heidegger: Emmanuel Levinas’s Ethics as First Philosophy, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Marcus, Paul, 2008, Being for the Other: Emmanuel Levinas, Ethical Living and Psychoanalysis (Marquette Studies in Philosophy, 65), Milwaukee, WI: Marquette University Press.
  • Marion, Jean-Luc, 1986, Prolégomènes à la charité, second edition, Paris: Éditions la Différence. Translated as Prolegomena to Charity (Perspectives in Continental Philosophy 24), Stephen E. Lewis (trans.), New York: Fordham University Press, 2002.
  • –––, 1989, Réduction et donation: recherches sur Husserl, Heidegger et la phénoménologie, Paris: Presses universitaires de France. Translated as Reduction and Givenness: Investigations of Husserl, Heidegger, and Phenomenology (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy), Thomas A. Carlson (trans.), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1998.
  • Mensch, James R., 2015, Levinas’s Existential Analytic: A Commentary on Totality and Infinity (Studies in Phenomenology and Existential Philosophy), Chicago: Northwestern University Press.
  • Messina, Aïcha Liviana, 2018, L’anarchie de la paix: Levinas et la philosophie politique (CNRS philosophie), Paris: CNRS éditions.
  • Moati, Raoul, 2012 [2017], Evénements nocturnes: essai sur Totalité et Infini (Le bel aujourd’hui), Paris: Hermann. Translated as Levinas and the Night of Being: A Guide to Totality and Infinity, Daniel Wyche (trans.), New York: Fordham University Press, 2017.
  • Mole, Gary D., 1997, Lévinas, Blanchot, Jabès: Figures of Estrangement (Crosscurrents : Comparative Studies in European Literature and Philosophy), Gainesville, FL: University Press of Florida.
  • Morgan, Michael L., 2007, Discovering Levinas, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511805240
  • –––, 2011, The Cambridge Introduction to Emmanuel Levinas, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511921551
  • –––, 2016, Levinas’s Ethical Politics (The Helen and Martin Schwartz Lectures in Jewish Studies), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Morrison, Glenn, 2013, A Theology of Alterity: Levinas, Von Balthasar, and Trinitarian Praxis, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Moten, Fred, 2018, The Universal Machine (Consent Not to Be a Single Being 3), Durham, NC: Duke University Press.
  • Murray, Jeffrey W., 2003, Face to Face in Dialogue: Emmanuel Leninas and (the) Communication (of) Ethics, Lanham, MD: University Press of America.
  • Ndayizigiye, Thaddée, 1997, Réexamen éthique des droits de l’homme sous l’éclairage de la pensée d’Emmanuel Levinas (Europäische Hochschulschriften Reihe 23, Theologie = Théologie = Theology 607), Bern: Lang.
  • Neendoor, Thomas, 1998, Communion: An Ecclesiological Analysis of the Concept of Communion of the Thomas Christians in the Light of the Idea of Self in Emmanuel Levinas (Pontifical Oriental Institute of Religious Studies 205), Kattayam, Kerala, India: Pontifical Oriental Institute of religious studies.
  • Newton, Adam Zachary, 2001, The Fence and the Neighbor: Emmanuel Levinas, Yeshayahu Leibowitz, and Israel among the Nations (SUNY Series in Jewish Philosophy), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Nordmann, Sophie, 2017, Levinas et la philosophie judéo-allemande (Bibliothèque d’histoire de la philosophie. Nouvelle série), Paris: Librairie philosophique J. Vrin.
  • Oppenheim, Michael D., 1997, Speaking/Writing of God: Jewish Philosophical Reflections on the Life with Others (SUNY Series in Jewish Philosophy), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Peperzak, Adriaan Theodoor, 1993, To the Other: An Introduction to the Philosophy of Emmanuel Levinas (Purdue University Series in the History of Philosophy), West Lafayette, IN: Purdue University Press.
  • –––, 1997, Beyond: The Philosophy of Emmanuel Levinas (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology & Existential Philosophy), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press.
  • Perez, Félix, 2016, Apprendre à philosopher avec Levinas (Apprendre à philosopher avec), Paris: Ellipses.
  • Perpich, Diane, 2008, The Ethics of Emmanuel Levinas (Cultural Memory in the Present), Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
  • Petrosino, Silvano and Jacques Rolland, 1984, La vérité nomade: introduction à Emmanuel Lévinas (Armillaire), Paris: Découverte.
  • Plant, Bob, 2005, Wittgenstein and Levinas: Ethical and Religious Thought, London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203023112
  • Plourde, Simonne, 1996, Emmanuel Lévinas, altérité et responsabilité: guide de lecture (La Nuit surveillée), Paris: Cerf.
  • Poirié, François, 1992,, Emmanuel Lévinas (Qui êtes-vous? 20), Lyon: La Manufacture.
  • Ponzio, Augusto, 1996, Sujet et altérité sur Emmanuel Lévinas: suivi de deux dialogues avec Emmanuel Lévinas (Philosophie en commun), Paris: L’Harmattan.
  • Puntel, Lorenz B., 2010 [2011], Sein und Gott: ein systematischer Ansatz in Auseinandersetzung mit M. Heidegger, E. Lévinas und J.-L. Marion (Philosophische Untersuchungen 26), Tübingen: Mohr Siebeck. Translated as Being and God: A Systematic Approach in Confrontation with Martin Heidegger, Emmanuel Levinas, and Jean-Luc Marion, Alan White (trans.), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 2011.
  • Purcell, Michael, 1998, Mystery and Method: The Other in Rahner and Levinas, Milwaukee, WI: Marquette University Press.
  • Putnam, Hilary, 2008, Jewish Philosophy as a Guide to Life: Rosenzweig, Buber, Levinas, Wittgenstein (The Helen and Martin Schwartz Lectures in Jewish Studies), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Rabinovich, Silvana, 2003, La trace dans le palimpseste: lectures de Levinas (La philosophie en commun), Paris: L’Harmattan.
  • Rae, Gavin, 2016, The Problem of Political Foundations in Carl Schmitt and Emmanuel Levinas, London: Palgrave Macmillan UK. doi:10.1057/978-1-137-59168-5
  • Ricœur, Paul, 1990 [1992], Soi-même comme un autre (Ordre philosophique), Paris: Seuil. Translated as Oneself as Another, Kathleen Blamey (trans.), Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1992.
  • –––, 1997, Autrement: lecture d’Autrement qu’être, ou, au-delà de l’essence d’Emmanuel Levinas (Collection Les essais du Collège international de philosophie), Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Robbins, Jill, 1991, Prodigal Son/Elder Brother: Interpretation and Alterity in Augustine, Petrarch, Kafka, Levinas (Religion and Postmodernism), Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • –––, 1999, Altered Reading: Levinas and Literature, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.
  • Rolland, Jacques, 2000, Parcours de l’autrement: lecture d’Emmanuel Lévinas (Epiméthée), Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Rose, Gillian, 1992, The Broken Middle: Out of Our Ancient Society, Oxford/Cambridge, MA: Blackwell.
  • –––, 1993, Judaism and Modernity: Philosophical Essays, Cambridge, MA: Blackwell.
  • Rychter, Ewa, 2004, (Un)Saying the Other: Allegory and Irony in Emmanuel Levinas’s Ethical Language (Literary and Cultural Theory 17), New York: Lang.
  • Saint-Cheron, Michaël de, 2006 [2010], Entretiens avec Emmanuel Levinas, 1992–1994: suivis de, Levinas entre philosophie et pensée juive, Paris, France: Livre de poche. Translated as Conversations with Emmanuel Levinas, 1983–1994, Gary D. Mole (trans.), Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press, 2010.
  • Salanskis, Jean-Michel, 2006, Levinas vivant (L’arbre de Judée 13), Paris: Belles lettres.
  • Saracino, Michele, 2003, On Being Human: A Conversation with Lonergan and Levinas (Marquette Studies in Theology 35), Milwaukee, WI: Marquette University Press.
  • Schroeder, Brian, 1996, Altared Ground: : Levinas, History, and Violence, 0 edition, New York/London: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203760529
  • Sealey, Kris, 2013, Moments of Disruption: Levinas, Sartre, and the Question of Transcendence, Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Sebbah, François-David, 2000, Lévinas: ambiguïtés de l’altérité (Figures du savoir 28), Paris: Les Belles Lettres.
  • –––, 2001 [2012], L’épreuve de la limite: Derrida, Henry, Levinas et la phénoménologie (Bibliothèque du Collège international de philosophie), Paris: Presses universitaires de France. Translated as Testing the Limit: Derrida, Henry, Levinas, and the Phenomenological Tradition (Cultural Memory in the Present), Stephen Barker (trans.), Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
  • –––, 2009, Lévinas et le contemporain: les préoccupations de l’heure, Besançon: Solitaires intempestifs.
  • –––, 2018a, L’éthique du survivant: Levinas, une philosophie de la débâcle (Collection Humanités-hominités), Nanterre: Presses universitaires de Paris Nanterre. [Sebbah 2018 available online]
  • –––, 2018b, “L’éthique comme culpabilité du survivant”, in Sebbah 2018a: 39–57 (ch. 2).
  • Seong, ShinHyung, 2018, Otherness and Ethics: An Ethical Discourse of Levinas and Confucius (Kongzi), Eugene, OR: Wipf & Stock.
  • Severson, Eric R., 2013, Levinas’s Philosophy of Time: Gift, Responsibility, Diachrony, Hope, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Shepherd, Andrew, 2014, The Gift of the Other: Levinas, Derrida, and a Theology of Hospitality (Princeton Theological Monographs Series 207), Eugene, OR: Pickwick Publications.
  • Simmons, William Paul, 2003, An-Archy and Justice: An Introduction to Emmanuel Levinas’s Political Thought, Lanham, MD: Lexington Books.
  • Smith, Michael B., 2005, Toward the Outside: Concepts and Themes in Emmanuel Levinas, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Smith, Steven G., 1983, The Argument to the Other: Reason beyond Reason in the Thought of Karl Barth and Emmanuel Levinas (American Academy of Religion Academy Series 42), Chico, CA: Scholars Press.
  • Sparrow, Tom, 2013, Levinas Unhinged, Alresford, Hants: Zero Books/John Hunt Publishing.
  • Srajek, Martin C., 1998, In the Margins of Deconstruction: Jewish Conceptions of Ethics in Emmanuel Levinas and Jacques Derrida (Contributions to Phenomenology 32), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer Academic Publishers. doi:10.1007/978-94-011-5198-6
  • Sandford, Stella, 2000, The Metaphysics of Love: Gender and Transcendence in Levinas, New Brunswick, NJ: Athlone Press.
  • Stone, Ira F., 1998, Reading Levinas/Reading Talmud: An Introduction, Philadelphia: Jewish Publication Society.
  • Stone, Matthew, 2016, Levinas, Ethics and Law, Edinburgh: Edinburgh University Press.
  • Strasser, Stephan, 1978, Jenseits von Sein und Zeit: eine Einführung in Emmanuel Levinas’ Philosophie (Phaenomenologica 78), Den Haag: M. Nijhoff.
  • Strasser, Stephan, 1983, “Emmanuel Levinas: Ethik als erste Philosophie”, in Bernhard Waldenfels’ Phänomenologie in Frankreich (Suhrkamp taschenbuch wissenschaft 644), Berlin: Suhrkamp, 218–265 (ch. 4).
  • Theunissen, Michael, 1965 [1984], Der Andere: Studien zur Sozialontologie der Gegenwart, Berlin: de Gruyter. Second edition 1977. Translated as The Other: Studies in the Social Ontology of Husserl, Heidegger, Sartre, and Buber (Studies in Contemporary German Social Thought), Christopher Macann (trans.), Cambridge, MA: MIT Press, 1984.
  • Tahmasebi-Birgani, Victoria, 2014, Emmanuel Levinas and the Politics of Non-Violence, Toronto: University of Toronto Press.
  • Thomas, Elisabeth Louise, 2004, Emmanuel Levinas: Ethics, Justice, and the Human beyond Being (Studies in Philosophy), London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203504970
  • Todd, Sharon, 2003, Learning from the Other: Levinas, Psychoanalysis, and Ethical Possibilities in Education (SUNY Series, Second Thoughts), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Topolski, Anya, 2015, Arendt, Levinas and a Politics of Relationality (Reframing the Boundaries), London: Rowman & Littlefield International. doi:10.5040/9798881809720
  • Toumayan, Alain P., 2004, Encountering the Other: The Artwork and the Problem of Difference in Blanchot and Levinas, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Vasseleu, Cathryn, 1998, Textures of Light: Vision and Touch in Irigaray, Levinas, and Merleau-Ponty (Warwick Studies in European Philosophy), London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203047705
  • Veling, Terry A., 2014, For You Alone: Emmanuel Levinas and the Answerable Life, Eugene, OR: Cascade Books.
  • Wall, Thomas Carl, 1999, Radical Passivity: Lévinas, Blanchot, and Agamben, New York: State University of New York Press.
  • Wehrs, Donald R., 2013, Levinas and Twentieth-Century Literature: Ethics and the Reconstitution of Subjectivity, Newark, NJ: University of Delaware Press.
  • Westphal, Merold, 2008, Levinas and Kierkegaard in Dialogue (Indiana Series in the Philosophy of Religion), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Winkler, Rafael, 2018, Philosophy of Finitude: Heidegger, Levinas, and Nietzsche, London: Bloomsbury Academic.
  • Wolff, Ernst, 2007, De l’ethique à la justice: langage et politique dans la philosophie de Lévinas (Phaenomenologica 183), Dordrecht: Springer. doi:10.1007/978-1-4020-6122-6
  • Wolfson, Elliot R., 2014, Giving beyond the Gift: Apophasis and Overcoming Theomania, New York: Fordham University Press. doi:10.5422/fordham/9780823255702.001.0001
  • –––, 2025, Nocturnal Seeing: Hopelessness of Hope and Philosophical Gnosis in Susan Taubes, Gillian Rose, and Edith Wyschogrod (Cultural Memory in the Present book series), Stanford, California: Stanford University Press. doi:10.1515/9781503640979
  • Wyschogrod, Edith, 1974 [2000], Emmanuel Levinas: The Problem of Ethical Metaphysics, The Hague: Nijhoff. Second edition, New York: Fordham University Press, 2000.
  • Zielinski, Agata, 2002, Lecture de Merleau-Ponty et Levinas: le corps, le monde, l’autre (Philosophie d’aujourd’hui), Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Zimmermann, Nigel, 2013, Levinas and Theology (Philosophy and Theology Series), London ; New York: Bloomsbury.

C.2 Articles, Journals and Edited Volumes on Levinas

  • Aeschlimann, Jean-Christophe (ed.), 1989, Répondre d’autrui. Emmanuel Lévinas (Langages), Neuchâtel: à la Baconnière.
  • Alexander, Hanan, 2014, “Education in Nonviolence: Levinas’ Talmudic Readings and the Study of Sacred Texts”, Ethics and Education, 9(1): 58–68. doi:10.1080/17449642.2014.890273
  • Altonji, Alexander, 2023, “Must Skepticism Remain Refuted? Inheriting Skepticism with Cavell and Levinas”, Topoi, 42(1): 61–72. doi:10.1007/s11245-022-09849-3
  • Anckaert, Luc, 2020, “Ethics of Responsibility and Ambiguity of Politics in Levinas’s Philosophy”, Problemos, 97: 61–74. doi:10.15388/Problemos.97.5
  • Atterton, Peter, Matthew Calarco, and Maurice S. Friedman (eds), 2004, Levinas & Buber: Dialogue & Difference, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Atterton, Peter and Matthew Calarco (eds), 2010, Radicalizing Levinas (SUNY Series in Radical Social and Political Theory), Albany, NY: SUNY Press.
  • Bernasconi, Robert, 1982, “Levinas Face to Face—with Hegel”, Journal of the British Society for Phenomenology, 13(3): 267–276. doi:10.1080/00071773.1982.11007593
  • –––, 1986, “Hegel and Levinas: The Possibility of Reconciliation and Forgiveness”, Archivio di filosofia, 54: 325–346.
  • –––, 1987, “Deconstruction and the Possibility of Ethics”, in Deconstruction and Philosophy: The Texts of Jacques Derrida, John Sallis (ed.), Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 122–139 (ch. 10).
  • –––, 1988, “Levinas: Philosophy and Beyond”, in Philosophy and Non-Philosophy since Merleau-Ponty (Continental Philosophy 1), Hugh J. Silverman (ed.), New York: Routledge, 232–258.
  • –––, 1988, “The Silent Anarchic World of the Evil Genius”, in The Collegium Phaenomenologicum, The First Ten Years (Phaenomenologica 105), John C. Sallis, Giuseppina Moneta, and Jacques Taminiaux (eds), Dordrecht/Boston: Kluwer, 257–272. doi:10.1007/978-94-009-2805-3_14
  • –––, 2002, “What Is the Question to Which ‘substitution’ Is the Answer?”, in Critchley and Bernasconi 2002: 234–251 (ch. 11). doi:10.1017/CCOL0521662060.011
  • Bernasconi, Robert and Simon Critchley (eds), 1991, Re-Reading Levinas (Studies in Continental Thought), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Bernasconi, Robert and David Wood (eds), 1988, The Provocation of Levinas: Rethinking the Other (Warwick Studies in Philosophy and Literature), London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203402047
  • Bernet, Rudolf, 2002, “Levinas’s Critique of Husserl”, in Critchley and Bernasconi 2002: 82–99 (ch. 4). doi:10.1017/CCOL0521662060.004
  • Bloechl, Jeffrey (ed.), 2000, The Face of the Other and the Trace of God: Essays on the Philosophy of Emmanuel Levinas (Perspectives in Continental Philosophy 10). New York: Fordham University Press.
  • Burggraeve, Roger (ed.), 2008, The Awakening to the Other: A Provocative Dialogue with Emmanuel Levinas, Leuven/Dudley, MA: Peeters.
  • Butler, Judith, 2020, The Force of Nonviolence: An Ethico-Political Bind, London/New York: Verso.
  • Cahiers d’études lévinassiennes, 2002-present, an annual book series, Arcueil (originally Jerusalem): Institut d’études lévinassiennes.
  • Cai, Wenjing, 2021, “Freedom, Normativity and Finitude: Between Heidegger and Levinas”, Human Studies: A Journal for Philosophy and the Social Sciences, 44(3): 397–411. doi:10.1007/s10746-021-09580-9
  • Chalier, Catherine and Miguel Abensour (eds), 1991, Emmanuel Lévinas (Cahier de L’Herne 60), Paris: Editions de l’Herne.
  • Chanter, Tina (ed.), 2001, Feminist Interpretations of Emmanuel Levinas (Re-Reading the Canon), University Park, PA: Pennsylvania State University Press.
  • Cohen, Richard A. (ed.), 1986, Face to Face with Levinas (SUNY Series in Philosophy), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • ––– (ed.), 2009, Cahiers d’études lévinassiennes No. 8: Lévinas-Rosenzweig, Arcueil: Institut d’Études Lévinassiennes.
  • Cohen-Levinas, Danielle (ed.), 1998, Emmanuel Levinas (Rue Descartes 19), Paris: Presses Universitaires de France.
  • –––, 2006, Levinas, Paris: Bayard.
  • –––, 2010, Le souci de l’art chez Emmanuel Levinas (Le marteau sans maître), Houilles: Manucius.
  • –––, 2011, Lire “Totalité et infini” d’Emmanuel Levinas: Études et interprétations (Rue de la Sorbonne), Paris: Hermann.
  • ––– (ed.), 2015, Emmanuel Levinas:  “Être juif” suivi d’une Lettre à Maurice Blanchot (Rivages poche), Paris: Éditions Payot & Rivages.
  • Cohen-Lévinas, Danielle and Marc Crépon (eds), 2015, Lévinas, Derrida: Lire Ensemble (Rue de La Sorbonne), Paris: Hermann.
  • Cohen-Levinas, Danielle and Alexander Schnell (eds), 2015, Relire “Totalité et infini” d’Emmanuel Levinas (Problèmes et controverses), Paris: Vrin.
  • ––– (eds), 2016, Relire “Autrement qu’être, ou, au-delà de l’essence” d’Emmanuel Levinas (Problèmes et controverses), Paris: J. Vrin.
  • ––– (eds), 2021, Levinas lecteur de Heidegger (Problèmes & controverses), Paris: Librairie philosophique J. Vrin.
  • Cohen-Levinas, Danielle and Shmuel Trigano (eds), 2002, Emmanuel Levinas, philosophie et judaïsme (Collection Lettres promises), Paris: In press.
  • ––– (eds), 2007, Emmanuel Lévinas et les théologies (Pardès : études et cultures juives 42), Paris: In press.
  • Critchley, Simon, 1999b, “The Original Traumatism: Levinas and Psychoanalysis”, in Critchley 1999a: 183–197 (ch. 8).
  • –––, 2004, “Five Problems in Levinas’s View of Politics and the Sketch of a Solution to Them”, Political Theory, 32(2): 172–185. doi:10.1177/0090591703261771
  • Critchley, Simon and Robert Bernasconi (eds), 2002, The Cambridge Companion to Levinas, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CCOL0521662060
  • Crowell, Steven, 2015, “Why Is Ethics First Philosophy? Levinas in Phenomenological Context: Why Is Ethics First Philosophy?”, European Journal of Philosophy, 23(3): 564–588. doi:10.1111/j.1468-0378.2012.00550.x
  • De Vries, Hent, 1998, “Levinas”, in A Companion to Continental Philosophy, Simon Critchley and William R. Schroeder (eds), Malden, MA/Oxford: Blackwell, 245–255 (ch. 20). doi:10.1002/9781405164542.ch20
  • Derrida, Jacques, 1964 [1978], “Violence et métaphysique: essai sur la pensée d’Emmanuel Levinas”, in two parts in the Revue de Métaphysique et de Morale, 69(3): 322–354 and 69(4): 425–473. Collected in L’Écriture et la différence (Collection Tel quel), Paris: Éditions du Seuil, 1967, ch. 4. Translated “Violence and Metaphysics: An Essay on the Thought of Emmanuel Levinas”, in Writing and Difference, Alan Bass (trans.), Chicago: University of Chicago Press, 1978, 79–153 (ch. 4).
  • –––, 1980 [1991], “En ce moment même dans cet ouvrage me voici”, in Textes pour Emmanuel Lévinas (Collection Surfaces 2), François Laruelle (ed.), Paris: Jean-Michel Place, 21–60. Translated as “At This Very Moment in This Work Here I Am”, Ruben Berezdivin (trans.), in Re-Reading Levinas (Studies in Continental Thought), Robert Bernasconi and Simon Critchley (eds), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 11–49 (ch. 2).
  • Desmond, William, 1994, “Philosophies of Religion: Marcel, Jaspers, Levinas”, in Routledge History of Philosophy Volume VIII: Twentieth-Century Continental Philosophy, Richard Kearney (ed.), London/New York: Routledge, 131-174 (ch. 5).
  • Dimitrova, Maria (ed.), 2011, In Levinas’ Trace, Newcastle upon Tyne: Cambridge Scholars Publishing.
  • Drabinski, John E. and Eric Sean Nelson (eds), 2014, Between Levinas and Heidegger (SUNY Series in Contemporary Continental Philosophy), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Dupuis, Michel (ed.), 1994, Levinas en contrastes (Point philosophique), Bruxelles: De Boeck-Wesmael.
  • Edelglass, William, James Hatley, and Christian Diehm (eds), 2012, Facing Nature: Levinas and Environmental Thought, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Eisenstadt, Oona, 2003, “The Problem of the Promise: Derrida on Levinas on the Cities of Refuge”, CrossCurrents, 52(4): 474–482.
  • –––, 2019, “Rhetorical Subterfuge: A Reading of Levinas’s ‘Promised Land or Permitted Land’”, Levinas Studies, 13: 27–42. doi:10.5840/levinas20207146
  • Eisenstadt, Oona and Claire Elise Katz, 2016, “The Faceless Palestinian: A History of an Error”, Telos, 174: 9–32. doi:10.3817/0316174009
  • Eskenazi, Tamara Cohn, Gary A. Philips, and David Jobling (eds), 2003, Levinas and Biblical Studies (Society of Biblical Literature Semeia Studies 43), Atlanta, GA: Society of Biblical Literature.
  • Fagenblat, Michael, 2015, “‘The Passion of Israel’: The True Israel According to Levinas, or Judaism ‘as a Category of Being’”, Sophia, 54(3): 297–320. doi:10.1007/s11841-015-0463-3
  • Faulconer, James, 2004, “Emmanuel Lévinas (1906–1995)”, in Twentieth-Century European Cultural Theorists. Second Series (Dictionary of Literary Biography 296), Paul Hansom (ed.), Detroit, MI: Gale, 285–295.
  • Feron, Étienne (ed.), 1990, Emmanuel Lévinas, issue of Études phénoménologiques, 6(12).
  • Froese, Robert, 2020, “Levinas and the Question of Politics”, Contemporary Political Theory, 19(1): 1–19. doi:10.1057/s41296-019-00320-4
  • Frogneux, Nathalie and Françoise Mies (eds), 1998, Emmanuel Lévinas et l’histoire: actes du colloque international des Facultés Universitaires Notre-Dame de la Paix (20 – 21 – 22 mai 1997) (Collection “Philosophie” 5), Paris: Cerf/Presses universitaires de Namur.
  • Gantt, Edwin E. and Richard N. Williams (eds), 2002, Psychology for the Other: Levinas, Ethics and the Practice of Psychology, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Glass, Jordan, 2018, “Education as Ethics: Emmanuel Levinas on Jewish Schooling”, Continental Philosophy Review, 51(4): 481–505. doi:10.1007/s11007-018-9440-1
  • Gold, Moshe and Sandor Goodhart (eds), 2018, Of Levinas and Shakespeare: “To See Another Thus”, West Lafayette, IN: Purdue University Press.
  • Greisch, Jean and Jacques Rolland (eds), 1993, Emmanuel Lévinas: l’éthique comme philosophie première: actes du colloque de Cerisy-la-Salle, 23 août-2 septembre 1986 (Nuit surveillée), Paris: Cerf.
  • Guenther, Lisa, 2018, “Dwelling in Carceral Space”, Levinas Studies, 12: 61–82. doi:10.5840/levinas20197101
  • Gutting, Gary, 2001, “Fin-de-Siècle Again: ‘Le Temps Retrouvé’? Levinas”, in his French Philosophy in the Twentieth Century, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 353–363. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511806902.014
  • Haar, Michel, 1991, “L’obsession de l’autre: l’éthique comme traumatisme”, in Chalier and Abensour 1991: 525–538.
  • Halpérin, Jean and Nelly Hansson (eds), 1998, Difficile justice: dans la trace d’Emmanuel Lévinas: actes du XXXVIe Colloque des intellectuels juifs de langue française (Présences du judaïsme), Paris: A. Michel.
  • Hammerschlag, Sarah, 2012, “‘A Splinter in the Flesh’: Levinas and the Resignification of Jewish Suffering, 1928–1947”, International Journal of Philosophical Studies, 20(3): 389–419. doi:10.1080/09672559.2012.699273
  • Hand, Seán (ed.), 1996, Facing the Other: The Ethics of Emmanuel Lévinas (Curzon Jewish Philosophy Series), Richmond, Surrey: Curzon.
  • Harasym, Sarah (ed.), 1998, Levinas and Lacan: The Missed Encounter (SUNY Series in Psychoanalysis and Culture), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Highlen, Jared, 2021, “Levinas and the Political Problem of Original Peace”, Continental Philosophy Review, 54(3): 319–330. doi:10.1007/s11007-021-09536-x
  • Horowitz, Asher and Gad Horowitz (eds), 2006, Difficult Justice: Commentaries on Levinas and Politics, Toronto: University of Toronto Press.
  • Janicaud, Dominique (ed.), 2000, La métaphysique d’Emmanuel Levinas, special issue of Noesis, 3. [Janicaud 2000 available online]
  • Jospe, Raphael (ed.), 1997, Paradigms in Jewish Philosophy, London: Associated University Presses.
  • Kalmanson, Leah, Frank Garrett, and Sarah A. Mattice (eds), 2013, Levinas and Asian Thought, Pittsburgh, PA: Duquesne University Press.
  • Katz, Claire Elise, 2012, Levinas and the Crisis of Humanism, Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Katz, Claire Elise with Lara Trout (eds), 2005, Emmanuel Levinas (Critical Assessments of Leading Philosophers), 4 vols., London: Routledge.
  • Kavka, Martin, 2010, “Screening the Canon: Levinas and Medieval Jewish Philosophy”, in New Directions in Jewish Philosophy, Aaron W. Hughes and Elliot R. Wolfson (eds), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 19–51 (ch. 1).
  • Kranz, Mendel, 2019, “Postcolonial Zionism: Theological-Political Paradigms in Levinas and Memmi”, Hebrew Studies, 60(1): 293–321. doi:10.1353/hbr.2019.0011
  • Lapidot, Elad, 2021, “Heidegger as Levinas’s Guide to Judaism beyond Philosophy”, Religions, 12(7): article 477. doi:10.3390/rel12070477
  • Laruelle, François (ed.), 1980, Textes pour Emmanuel Lévinas (Collection Surfaces 2), Paris: Jean-Michel Place.
  • Levinas Studies: An Annual Review, Robert Bernasconi (ed.), started 2005, Pittsburgh: Duquesne University Press (17 volumes to date).
  • Llewelyn, John, 2002, “Levinas and Language”, in Critchley and Bernasconi 2002: 119–138 (ch. 6). doi:10.1017/CCOL0521662060.006
  • Lin, Yael (ed.), 2014, Levinas Faces Biblical Figures, Lanham, MD: Lexington Books.
  • Lissa, Giuseppe, 2002, “Phénoménologie et/ou herméneutique chez Emmanuel Levinas”, in Cohen-Levinas and Trigano 2002: 195–234.
  • Marion, Jean-Luc (ed.), 2000, Positivité et transcendance: suivi de Lévinas et la phénoménologie (Epiméthée), Paris: Presses universitaires de France.
  • Matthews, Eric, 1996, “After Structuralism: Lévinas, Derrida, and Lyotard”, in his Twentieth-Century French Philosophy, Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press, 157–186 (ch. 8).
  • McGettigan, Andrew, 2006, “The Philosopher’s Fear of Alterity: Levinas, Europe and Humanities ‘without Sacred History’”, Radical Philosophy, 140: 15–25. [McGettigan 2006 available online]
  • Meir, Ephraim, 2021, “A Virtual Dialogue between Gandhi and Levinas”, Religions, 12(6): article 422. doi:10.3390/rel12060422
  • Métais, Fabrice and Mario Villalobos, 2021, “Embodied Ethics: Levinas’ Gift for Enactivism”, Phenomenology and the Cognitive Sciences, 20(1): 169–190. doi:10.1007/s11097-020-09692-0
  • –––, 2022, “Levinas’ Otherness: An Ethical Dimension for Enactive Sociality”, Topoi, 41(2): 327–339. doi:10.1007/s11245-021-09772-z
  • Mongin, Olivier (ed.), 1997, Lectures d’Emmanuel Levinas, several articles in Esprit, 234(7): 112–172.
  • New, Melvyn, Robert Bernasconi, and Richard A. Cohen (eds), 2001, In Proximity: Emmanuel Levinas and the Eighteenth Century, Lubbock, TX: Texas Tech University Press.
  • Ouaknin, Marc-Alain, 1993 [1995], Le livre brûlé: philospie du Talmud (Points Sagesses 52), Nouv. éd. rev. et corr, Paris: Lieu Commun. Translated as The Burnt Book: Reading the Talmud, Llewellyn Brown (trans.), Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press, 1995.
  • Pawlett-Jackson, Sarah, 2021, “Many Faces, Plural Looks: Enactive Intersubjectivity Contra Sartre and Levinas”, Phenomenology and the Cognitive Sciences, 21(4): 903–925. doi:10.1007/s11097-021-09766-7
  • Peperzak, Adriaan Theodoor (ed.), 1995, Ethics as First Philosophy: The Significance of Emmanuel Levinas for Philosophy, Literature, and Religion, New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781315822228
  • Podolsky, Robin, 2019, “Sumud Freedom Camp: Levinas’ Face-to-Face in Praxis”, Religions, 10(4): article 256. doi:10.3390/rel10040256
  • Rolland, Jacques (ed.), 1984, Emmanuel Lévinas (Les Cahiers de La nuit surveillée 3), Lagrasse: Verdier. Annual, special issue devoted to Levinas.
  • Sallis, John, Giuseppina Moneta, and Jacques Taminiaux (ed.), 1988, The Collegium Phaenomenologicum: The First Ten Years, Berlin: Springer.
  • Shankman, Steven and Massimo Lollini (eds), 2002, Who, Exactly, Is The Other? Western and Transcultural Perspectives, Eugene, OR: University of Oregon Books.
  • Simmons, J. Aaron and David Wood (eds), 2008, Kierkegaard and Levinas: Ethics, Politics, and Religion (Indiana Series in the Philosophy of Religion), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Trigano, Shmuel (ed.), 1997, L’école de pensée juive de Paris (Pardès 23), Paris: In Press.
  • –––, 2002, “Levinas et le projet de la philosophie juive”, Cohen-Levinas and Trigano 2002: 145–178.
  • Veulemans, Sophie, 2008, “On Time: Levinas’ Appropriation of Bergson”, in Burggraeve (ed.) 2008, 279–302.
  • Villevieille, Laurent, 2021, “La déformalisation selon Heidegger et Levinas”, in Cohen-Lévinas and Schnell 2021, 167–182.
  • Włodarczyk, Rafał, 2021, “Hospitality, Asylum and Education: Around Emmanuel Levinas’s Talmudic Readings”, Ethics and Education, 16(3): 355–374. doi:10.1080/17449642.2021.1927318
  • Wolosky, Shira, 2017, “Two Types of Negative Theology; Or, What Does Negative Theology Negate?”, in Negative Theology as Jewish Modernity (New Jewish Philosophy and Thought), Michael Fagenblat (ed.), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 161–179 (ch. 7).
  • Wood, David and Robert Bernasconi (eds), 1982, Time and Metaphysics: A Collection of Original Papers, Coventry, UK: Parousia Press, University of Warwick.,
  • ––– (eds), 1985, Derrida and “Différance”, Coventry, UK: Parousia Press, University of Warwick. Reprinted Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1988.

C.3 Other Works Cited

  • Aristotle, Nicomachean Ethics, Terence Irwin (trans.), second revised edition, Indianapolis: Hackett Publishing, 2000.
  • Banon, David, 1987, La lecture infinie: les voies de l’interprétation midrachique, Paris: Seuil. Preface by Emmanuel Levinas.
  • –––, 2008, Entrelacs: la lettre et le sens dans l’exégèse juive (La nuit surveillée), Paris: Cerf.
  • Broch, Hermann, 1979, Massenwahntheorie, Frankfurt: Suhrkamp Verlag. Translated into French as Théorie de la folie des masses, Pierre Rusch and Didier Renault (trans.), Paris: Éditions de l’éclat, 2008.
  • Butler, Judith, 2005, Giving an Account of Oneself, New York: Fordham University Press.
  • Cohen, Hermann, 1915, Der Begriff der Religion im System der Philosophie (Philosophische Arbeiten, 10. Bd., 1. Heft), Giessen: A. Töpelmann.
  • Critchley, Simon, 2007, Infinitely Demanding: Ethics of Commitment, Politics of Resistance, London/New York: Verso.
  • Di Paolo, Ezequiel A., Elena Clare Cuffari, and Hanne De Jaegher, 2018, Linguistic Bodies: The Continuity between Life and Language, Cambridge, MA: The MIT Press.
  • Doyon, Maxime and Thiemo Breyer (eds), 2015, Normativity in Perception, London: Palgrave Macmillan. doi:10.1057/9781137377920
  • Eagleton, Terry, 2009, Trouble with Strangers: A Study of Ethics, Chichester, UK/Malden, MA: Wiley-Blackwell. doi:10.1002/9781444304633
  • Franck, Didier, 1981 [2013], Chair et corps: sur la phénoménologie de Husserl (Arguments), Paris: Editions de Minuit. Translated as Flesh and Body: On the Phenomenology of Husserl, Joseph Rivera and Scott Davidson (trans), New York: Bloomsbury, 2013.
  • Froese, Tom and Ezequiel Di Paolo, 2009, “Sociality and the Life-Mind Continuity Thesis”, Phenomenology and the Cognitive Sciences, 8(4): 439–463. doi:10.1007/s11097-009-9140-8.
  • Gadamer, Hans-Georg, 1960, Wahrheit und Methode, Tübingen: J.C.B. Mohr. Translated as Truth and Method, Hans-Georg Gadamer (trans.), New York: Continuum, 1980.
  • Gordon, Peter Eli, 2003, Rosenzweig and Heidegger: Between Judaism and German Philosophy (Weimar and Now 33), Berkeley, CA: University of California Press.
  • Heidegger, Martin, 1927 [1982], Die Grundprobleme der Phänomenologie, lecture series 1927, first published 1975. Translated as The Basic Problems of Phenomenology, Albert Hofstadter (trans.), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 1982.
  • –––, 1929–1930 [1995], Die Grundbegriffe der Metaphysik: Welt—Endlichkeit—Einsamkeit, lecture series 1929–1930, published 1983. Translated as The Fundamental Concepts of Metaphysics: World, Finitude, Solitude, William McNeill and Nicholas Walker (trans), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 1995.
  • –––, 1929 [1997], Kant und das Problem der Metaphysik, first published 1929. Translated as Kant and the Problem of Metaphysics, Richard Taft (trans.), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 1997.
  • –––, 1923 [1999], Ontologie, Hermeneutik der Faktizität, lecture series 1923, published 1988. Translated as Ontology—The Hermeneutics of Facticity, John van Buren (trans.), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 1999.
  • –––, 1936–1968 [2000], Erläuterungen zu Hölderlins Dichtung, lectures given between 1936 and 1968, first published between 1936 and 1971, collected 1971. Translated as Elucidations of Hölderlin’s Poetry, Keith Hoeller (trans), Amherst, NY: Humanity Books, 2000.
  • –––, 1921–1922 [2001], Phänomenologische Interpretationen zu Aristoteles: Einführung in die phänomenologische Forschung, lecture series 1921–1922, published 1985. Translated as Phenomenological Interpretations of Aristotle: Initiation into Phenomenological Research, Richard Rojcewicz (trans.), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 2001.
  • Husserl, Edmund, 1935 [1970], “The Vienna Lecture”. Translated in The Crisis of European Sciences and Transcendental Phenomenology, David Carr (trans.), Evanston: Northwestern University Press, 1970, Appendix A.
  • –––, 1973a, Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjektivität. Texte aus dem Nachlass. Erster Teil 1905–1920 (Husserliana 13). Iso von Kern (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • –––, 1973b, Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjektivität. Texte aus dem Nachlass. Zweiter Teil: 1921–1928 (Husserliana 14), Iso von Kern (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • –––, 1973c, Zur Phänomenologie der Intersubjektivität. Texte aus dem Nachlass. Dritter Teil: 1929–1935 (Husserliana 15), Iso von Kern (ed.), The Hague: Martinus Nijhoff.
  • Kant, Immanuel, 1797, Die Metaphysik der Sitten, Riga: Hartknoch. Akademie Ausgabe [AA] 6. Translated as The Metaphysics of Morals, Mary Gregor (trans.), Cambridge: Cambridge University Press, 1996, 139–232.
  • Kavka, Martin, 2015, “Reading Messianically with Gershom Scholem”, in Rethinking the Messianic Idea in Judaism, Michael L. Morgan and Steven Weitzman (eds), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press, 404–418.
  • Koubová, Alice, 2014, “Invisible Excess of Sense in Social Interaction”, Frontiers in Psychology, 5: article 1081. doi:10.3389/fpsyg.2014.01081
  • Liska, Vivian, 2017, German-Jewish Thought and Its Afterlife: A Tenuous Legacy (Jewish Literature and Culture), Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • McDowell, John, 1998, Mind, Value, and Reality, Cambridge, MA: Harvard University Press.
  • Merleau-Ponty, Maurice, 1964 [1968], Le visible et l’invisible: suivi de notes de travail (Bibliothèque des idées), Claude Lefort (ed.), Paris: Gallimard. Translated as The Visible and the Invisible: Followed by Working Notes (Northwestern University Studies in Phenomenology & Existential Philosophy), Claude Lefort (ed.) Alphonso Lingis (trans.), Evanston, IL: Northwestern University Press, 1968.
  • Nancy, Jean-Luc, 1982, Le partage des voix (Débats), Paris: Galilée.
  • –––, 1983 [2003], “Le kategorein de l’excès” in L’impératif catégorique, Paris: Flammarion, 5–32. Translated as “The Kategorein of Excess”, in his A Finite Thinking (Cultural Memory in the Present), Simon Sparks (ed.), Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press, 133–151.
  • O’Neill, Onora, 1996, Towards Justice and Virtue: A Constructive Account of Practical Reasoning, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511621239
  • Salanskis, Jean-Michel, 2017, Le fait juif, Paris: Les Belles Lettres.
  • Shapiro, Lawrence A., 2011, Embodied Cognition (New Problems of Philosophy), London/New York: Routledge. Second edition, 2019. doi:10.4324/9781315180380
  • Smit, Houston and Mark Timmons, 2013, “Kant’s Grounding Project in The Doctrine of Virtue”, in Kant on Practical Justification: Interpretive Essays, Mark Timmons and Sorin Baiasu (eds), Oxford/New York: Oxford University Press, 229–268 (ch. 10). doi:10.1093/acprof:oso/9780195395686.003.0011
  • Stauffer, Jill, 2015, Ethical Loneliness: The Injustice of Not Being Heard, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Thompson, Evan (ed.), 2001, Between Ourselves:  Second-Person Issues in the Study of Consciousness, Charlottesville, VA: Imprint Academic.
  • –––, 2007, Mind in Life: Biology, Phenomenology, and the Sciences of Mind, Cambridge, MA: Belknap Press of Harvard University Press.
  • Varela, Francisco J., Evan Thompson, and Eleanor Rosch, 1991, The Embodied Mind: Cognitive Science and Human Experience, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press. doi:10.7551/mitpress/6730.001.0001
  • Wiggins, David, 1987 [1998], Needs, Values, Truth: Essays in the Philosophy of Value (Aristotelian Society Series, 6), Oxford/New York: Blackwell. Second edition Oxford: Oxford University Press, 1998. doi:10.1093/oso/9780198237198.001.0001
  • Žižek, Slavoj, 2005, “Neighbors and Other Monsters: A Plea for Ethical Violence”, in The Neighbor: Three Inquiries in Political Theology (Religion and Postmodernism), by Slavoj Žižek, Eric L. Santner, and Kenneth Reinhard, Chicago: University of Chicago Press.

C.4 Bibliographies and Concordance

  • Burggraeve, Roger, 1990, Emmanuel Levinas: Une bibliographie primaire et secondaire, Leuven: Éditions Peeters. (A comprehensive bibliography of works on Levinas from 1929 to 1989 in several languages.)
  • Ciocan, Cristian and Georges Hansel, 2005, Levinas Concordance, Dordrecht: Springer. doi:10.1007/1-4020-4125-X
  • Nordquist, Joan, 1997, Emmanuel Levinas: A Bibliography, Santa Cruz: Reference and Research Services.

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