Psychoanalytic Feminism

First published Mon May 16, 2011; substantive revision Fri Oct 3, 2025

This article will discuss psychoanalytic feminism, not feminist psychoanalysis (i.e., except indirectly, it will not address ideas about developing feminist principles in clinical practice, although most of the authors discussed below are trained analysts). The Austrian neurologist Sigmund Freud, who introduced the field of psychoanalysis in the late 19th and early 20th century, developed a theory of the unconscious that links sexuality and subjectivity ineluctably together. In doing so, he discloses how our sense of self, political loyalties, and attachments are influenced by unconscious drives and ordered by symbolic structures beyond the purview of individual agency. While some feminists have outlined implicit and explicit biases toward women contained in Freud’s psychoanalytic thought, other feminist thinkers have, nonetheless, undertaken a serious reading of Freud and developed careful analyses of their fundamental concepts, working out their limits, impasses, and possibilities.

In “Femininity,” Freud writes that “psycho-analysis does not try to describe what a woman is—that would be a task it could scarcely perform—but sets about enquiring how she comes into being, how a woman develops out of a child with a bisexual disposition” (Freud 1933 [1964: 144]). The bisexual child is one who psychically is not yet either a man or a woman. Freud here portrays femininity as one trajectory of the Oedipal Complex and indicates that sexed identity is a fragile achievement rather than a natural given or essence. By circumscribing the terrain on which the psychoanalytic account of sexual difference moves, and by seeing unresolved riddles where others might see the work of nature or culture, Freud problematizes any causal, seamless, or direct tie between sex, sexuality, and sexual difference. Psychoanalytic inquiry then does not fit comfortably with, and even unsettles, biological theories of sex and sociological theories of gender, thus also complicating the sex/gender distinction that some feminist theorists have formulated in terms of the contrast between biology and culture in feminist debates. Likewise, psychoanalytic feminism interrupts many assumptions about what feminism is, and the material objects it theorizes, including especially the very concept of woman.

While there is no doubt a vast oeuvre of disparate positions that might fall within the framework of psychoanalytic feminism, what they share in common is a descent from, respect for, and a drawing on Freudian psychoanalytic concepts, even while criticizing and revising his theoretical apparatus. Before this article outlines the multiple and divergent articulations of psychoanalytic feminism, it returns to Freud to establish the historical roots and the conceptual terrain on which psychoanalytic feminism arises. While this article introduces the reader to central psychoanalytic concepts, it will devote particular attention to Freud’s theories of the unconscious as they pertain to sexual differentiation and the Oedipal Complex, since a great deal of psychoanalytic feminism is concerned with revising the Oedipal narrative of Freud. Psychoanalytic feminists have also turned to the French psychoanalytic thinker Jacques Lacan, who drew on and further developed Freudian psychoanalysis in the late 20th century. Therefore, this article will also introduce Lacan’s central theoretical concepts before outlining how feminist thinkers have appropriated Lacanian psychoanalysis.

1. The Freudian Riddle of Femininity

Freud distinguishes two primary drives: the love drive (Eros) and the death drive (Thanatos). As he points out in Civilization and Its Discontents (1930) “Libido” refers to the manifestation of the power of Eros, that is, the energy of love drive, with sexual love as its nucleus and sexual union as its aim. However, Freud conceptualizes “love” in a broader sense, which includes not only sexual love for others but also self-love, friendship, and devotion to concrete objects and abstract ideas (1930 [1989: 80]). The aggressive drive is the main representative of the death drive, and manifests itself in a mutual hostility between and among people.

The death drive opposes civilization and threatens it perpetually with disintegration. For Freud, civilization is the struggle between Eros and Thanatos, between the drives of life and death. The most critical task of civilization is to set limits to the aggressive drive (1930 [1989: 69–70]). He outlines two ways in which civilization sets limits to the aggressive drive. First, through inhibiting the aim of libido (sexual union) and instead fostering affectionate ties between people. Second, establishing a superego within our psyches to monitor the aggressive drive. The superego is the part of the ego that observes, monitors, and criticizes the ego.

Therefore, rather than the rationally self-interested individual presumed by liberal political theory or the self-contained and independent cogito presumed by Cartesian epistemology, Freud puts forward a split subject in that the ego is both a subject and an object. As Freud outlines in the New Introductory Lectures on Psycho-Analysis (1933), although the ego is a subject, it can take itself as an object and treat itself like other objects by observing and criticizing itself. In Freud’s words, in the superego “part of the ego is setting itself over against the rest. So, the ego can be split; it splits itself during several functions—temporarily at least. Its parts can come together again afterward.” (1933 [1990: 73]). The superego is the part of the ego that sets itself over against the rest to take over and monitor our desire for aggressiveness and direct it back to where it came from—the ego.

The ego’s task is to satisfy the divergent and often incompatible demands of what Freud calls “three tyrannical masters”—the superego, the unconscious (the id), and the external world. The ego aims to represent the demands and standards of the external world to the id while also carrying out the id’s intentions as it’s from the id that the ego derives its life force. At the same time, the strict superego observes the ego at every step it takes and lays down definite standards for its conduct (1933 [1990:97]). The ego faces resistance against obeying the superego’s commands, foremost because of the strength of the unconscious energy of repressed aggressive (and libidinal) drives that lie in wait to unleash themselves.

Freud also explains that the presence of repressed drives unsettles any notion of a stable ego. As he puts it, the stability of the ego “is exposed to constant shocks. In dreams and in neuroses, what is thus excluded knocks for admission at the gates, guarded though they are by resistances” (1921 [1989:80]). The resistances allow only portions of the repressed material, often disguised, to enter our consciousness, such as in dreams and neuroses. Freud studied neuroses in his works on hysteria. In his early works on hysteria, we also find his claim about the impact of sexuality on psychic processes, which he changed in his later works. In hysteria, a repressed memory or an unconscious conflict is converted into a physical symptom without any physical causes. In Studies in Hysteria (1895), written in collaboration with the neurophysiologist Josef Breuer, Freud posits the “seduction hypothesis,” which implies that hysterical symptoms arise as a result of a trauma – childhood sexual violence. The repressed memory becomes somatized (enacted on the body and in bodily symptoms) when a later event, usually occurring in puberty, catalyzes the earlier memory traces.

In the later Three Essays on the Theory of Sexuality (1905a), Freud contends, contrary to the earlier supposition that sexuality intervenes from the outside, that sexuality is a primordial force of infantile life, arising from the bodily sensations that accompany the life processes. In the interim between these two works, Freud abandoned the seduction hypothesis and replaced it with the thesis of infantile sexuality and the idea that symptoms are brought about through conflicts and repressions of unconscious fantasies. To understand the significance of this transition in his thinking, we must grasp what Freud means by psychical reality and its distinction from material reality. In contrast to the historical, intersubjective domain of material reality, psychical reality is the vital domain of fantasy and intra-psychic life, operating independently of objective considerations of veracity.

In Freud’s view, unconscious fantasies are not lies or deceptions, but they reveal a concealed truth, not about the objective world, but about the internal life of the subject. In discarding the seduction hypothesis, Freud not only discovers the domain of fantasy and psychic reality, but he also paves the way for considering the energetics of the libido. However, Freud never abjures the reality of sexual abuse. Instead, the hysteric symptom no longer originates in (presumably rare) childhood sexual violence, but in repressed unconscious fantasies that accompany sexual differentiation, the becoming of a woman (or a man) out of a child with a bisexual constitution.

For Freud, bisexuality implies “an individual is not a man or a woman but always both—merely a certain amount more the one than the other” (1933 [1990: 141]). The proportion to which “masculinity” and “femininity” is mixed in individuals implies fluctuations. In “Hysterical Phantasies and Their Relation to Bisexuality (1908),” and his “General Remarks on Hysterical Attacks” (1909), Freud also details how the hysteric symptom emerges when the child with a bisexual constitution has to give up her masculinity (or femininity) to emerge as a woman (or man).

Here, it is important to note that for Freud, there is no essential femininity and masculinity. Instead, he asserts that “what constitutes masculinity or femininity is an unknown characteristic, which anatomy cannot lay hold of” (1933 [1990: 142, emphasis added]). He also problematizes the association of activity (and aggression) with masculinity and passivity with femininity and points out that social customs often force women into passivity. Furthermore, the denial of women’s aggression can create masochistic tendencies in women, where they turn their aggressive drive against themselves.

Nonetheless, in Freud’s discussion of hysteria and the Oedipal Complex, he often associates femininity with passivity and masculinity with activity (such as his assertion that pre-Oedipal female sexuality is masculine and active, and Oedipal female sexuality is feminine and passive), which contradicts his assertion that there is no essential femininity and masculinity. One way to understand this contradiction is that Freud describes “masculinity” and “femininity” as what is stereotypically associated with these concepts in a patriarchal society. Another way to understand this contradiction is that masculinity and femininity are in Freudian psychoanalyses unconscious sexual fantasies – they pertain to the realm of fantasy rather than nature or culture and reveal a concealed truth about the realm of psychic reality rather than material reality

For example, Freud points out that when psychoanalysts aim to resolve the hysteric symptom they are confronted with two unconscious sexual fantasies, one which has a masculine and the other a feminine character (1908 [1997:54]). In his “General Remarks on Hysterical Attacks” (1909), he explains that the hysteric attack in women recalls the masculine form of sexual activity to action that existed during childhood. As he puts it, “In a whole series of cases the hysterical neurosis is nothing but an excessive over-accentuation of the typical wave of repression through which the masculine type of sexuality is removed and the woman emerges” (1909 [1997:53]).

Therefore, neuroses are the result of the repression of the bisexual constitution, which all children have to go through to emerge as women or men. I include men here, as Freud initially studied neurosis through hysteria in men, and his first two public presentations on hysteria in Vienna (1886) dealt with male hysterics. Although Freud in his later works discussed hysteria chiefly through his analyses of women (and it remains chiefly associated with women), the male hysteric resurfaces in his unpublished works, including talks, correspondence, and his personal life.

Freud further detailed the content of sexual fantasies with the Oedipal Complex. In his later writings on femininity, including “Femininity” (1933), “Female Sexuality” (1931), and “Some Psychical Consequences of the Anatomical Distinction between the Sexes” (1925), Freud postulates that the little girl’s Oedipal Complex runs a different course than the little boy’s and holds a different relation to castration anxiety during sexual differentiation. Crucially, Freud maintains that femininity (and masculinity) cannot be grasped from a biological perspective.

Instead, sexual differentiation is centrally concerned with psychical reality and the realm of fantasy. The Oedipal story details the unconscious sexual fantasies that accompany our becoming subjects and, in becoming subjects, how we become sexually differentiated. In the pre-Oedipal phase, children are not yet sexually differentiated. Here the girl and the boy have a strong libidinal attachment to the “phallic mother” whom they envision as having a penis. Insofar as Freud associates the child’s desire for the mother with masculinity (and activity), he also defines libido as masculine. Still Freud acknowledges that in the libido’s most primordial stages, there can be no sexual distinction.

It is not until children pass through the Oedipal Complex that they can properly be said to have a genital organization which is acquired through a relation to castration and is the last stage in sexual development (following oral, anal, and phallic stages). For Freud, all children are in the undifferentiated phase “little men” with a phallic and active sexuality. Here, the girl experiences her father as a rival in her quest to seduce the mother and bear her a child. In addition, akin to the boy who derives pleasure from his “little penis,” the girl actively derives pleasure from her “little phallus” – her clitoris – via masturbation (1933 [1997:148–50]).

In order to become a woman and pass from the “masculine” into the “feminine” phase, the girl has to switch from her first object of love, the mother, to the father. Furthermore, she has to give up her focus on active sexuality and clitoral pleasure and, from now on, must passively focus on her vagina (1933 [1997:147]). Freud seems genuinely puzzled about how femininity comes about given the girl’s initial love for the mother, why she would switch allegiances to the father, and whom she experienced as a rival. And since prior to the genital organization, she too goes through a phallic (masturbatory) stage, why would she switch the site of bodily pleasure from the clitoris to the vagina?

These are among the mysteries he means to designate when referring to the riddle of femininity. That he understands it to be a riddle also intimates that he understands sexual identity not as a natural pre-given essence rooted in anatomy but rather as a form of individuation and differentiation realized through a complex interaction between the bodily drives and familial others. Freud postulates that it is the realization that the mother does not have a penis as the girl initially assumed, and that she is castrated, that prompts the little girl to turn her love away from the mother and toward her father, from whom she expects the penis via a penis-baby (which is fulfilled when she gets a baby later), and which turns the mother into a rival.

For the girl, castration does not resolve the Oedipal Complex but leads her to enter it, and for this reason Freud claims that it is never wholly brought to a conclusion, and that it is more difficult for her to form a superego 1933 [1997:160]). There is a great deal of feminist literature that accuses Freud of “matricide” and the repression of the pre-Oedipal mother via the Oedipus complex (see below). Freud, however, repeatedly points at the important of the girls’ pre-Oedipal attachment to the mother and points out that “For a long time the girl’s Oedipus complex concealed her pre-Oedipal attachment to the mother from our view, though it is nevertheless so important and leaves such lasting fixations behind it.” (1933 [1997:160]). One such fixation is the continuing hostility of the girl toward the mother. Furthermore, for Freud, femininity is a fragile achievement, and “in the course of women’s lives there is a repeated alteration between periods in which masculinity or femininity gains the upper hand” (1933 [1997:162]). Therefore, the bisexual constitution, which the girl had to repress to emerge as a woman, remains a force throughout her life.

The boy’s story is more seamless and continuous since he retains his phallic pleasure and, although he must displace the immediate object of his desire (no longer the mother, but someone like her), can look forward to substitute objects. The boy’s Oedipal attachment to the mother follows uninterrupted from a pre-Oedipal attachment, and it is brought to an end by the threat of castration emanating from the father. At the conclusion of the Oedipal Complex, the boy identifies with the father, sets up a severe super-ego (as a result of the threat of castration), and abandons the immediate object of desire (the mother) with the promise that he too will one day possess a similar object modeled on the mother (1933 [1997:160]).

Freud’s theories of sexuality and the unconscious implicate not only individual psychology but also the constitution of social life. Formed in ambivalent relation to others, sexuality, and sexual identity permeate the bonds of civilization and ramify throughout all social relations. In turning his attention to broader cultural questions, Freud offers a story or myth of the origin of political structures that parallels and echoes his understanding of the individual psyche. To understand the political import of the Oedipal Complex, placing it more generally within the scope of Freud’s understanding of group psychology will be helpful.

In Group Psychology and the Analysis of the Ego (1921), Freud contests any clear-cut opposition between group and individual psychology. The individual subject is neither formed wholly independently in a solitary interiority nor formed as merely an effect of exterior social forces. In this text, we learn why people join what Freud calls “psychological masses” and uncritically subordinate themselves to the will of a leader. Freud explains how the mass leader artificially makes the followers “fall in love” with him by creating aim-inhibited libidinal ties between the followers and himself. The mass followers then unite with each other and temporarily repress their hostility against each other through identification via their shared libidinal or love tie with the mass leader.

However, Freud points out that love need not be the central element that unifies mass followers. Instead, “the leader or the leading idea might also, so to speak, be negative; hatred against a particular person or institution might operate in just the same unifying way, and might call up the same unifying emotional ties as positive attachment” (1921 [1990:41]). Nothing binds people together in love like a common hatred against an “intruder”, upon whom they can unleash their aggression. Therefore, one can bind together large numbers of people in love, so long as there are other people left over to receive the manifestations of their aggressiveness. He points out how historically the hatred towards Jewish people had served to unite Christians “in love.”

Freud describes the processes that establish the libidinal ties between the mass followers and the leader with the idea of ego ideal replacement. The ego ideal serves as the repository of standards of perfection of various sorts. It represents our ideal view of ourselves and what we aspire to be like. Since we cannot always live up to our ego ideal, we feel a tension between the ego and the ego ideal in us that makes us feel like failures. Therefore, argues Freud, the “separation of the ego ideal from the ego cannot be born for long either, and has to be temporarily undone” (1921 [1990:81]). In festivals, the separation of the ego ideal from the ego is temporarily undone, and their cheerful character signifies a release from ego ideal demands.

In a psychological mass, the followers internalize the idealized leader figure and replace their ego ideal with the leader figure, which generates a more permanent undoing of the separation between the ego and the ego ideal, which allows them to get rid of feelings of failure and inferiority and feel via the leader “great again.” Furthermore, in a psychological mass, we transfer our renounced narcissism or self-love to the leader, and the leader (the love object) “serves as a substitute for some unattained ego ideal of our own. We love it on account of the perfections which we have striven to reach for our own ego, and which we should now procure in this roundabout way as a means to satisfying our narcissism” (1921 [1990:56]).

The problem of transferring our self-love to the leader is that our love becomes blind and we ascribe perfection to the love object, to which the leader has no claim. Furthermore, when the love object (the leader) gets in possession of the entire self-love of the ego, at the end, “(t)he object, has, so to speak, consumed the ego.” (1921 [1990:56–57, emphasis added]). Subjects with an impoverished and consumed ego completely surrender themselves to the leader and fail to be critical of his deeds and demands on the followers, and they are ready to carry out crimes for their leader.

Freud also explains the complete surrender of the followers to the leader, because ego ideal replacement generates also a regression to an older form of human psychology, the psychology of the “primal horde” which makes us, in a way akin to hypnosis, experience the leader as the primal father with a dangerous personality to whose will we must surrender. As Freud puts it, “The leader of the group is still the dreaded father; the group still wishes to be governed by unrestricted force; it has an extreme passion for authority. . . The primal father is the group ideal, which governs the ego in the place of the ego ideal” (1921 [1990:7]). In the hypnotic state, the conscious personality of the hypnotized mass followers vanishes, and their unconscious personality predominates, which makes it easier for the leader to manipulate the followers for his purposes.

In Totem and Taboo (1913) Freud outlines the archaic “primal horde,” which refers to an earlier form of human society that was ruled despotically by a powerful and threatening male, the primal father, which gets reactivated in mass psychology. The experience of the primal horde is part of our inheritance; it has left traces in all of our psyches. In the primal horde, the brothers had ambivalent feelings toward their father. The brothers hated him because he was an obstacle to their cravings for power and satisfying their sexual desires on the women that belonged to the father, but they also loved and admired him. None of the brothers individually could topple and replace the father, which was why they banded together to kill him. After they killed him they devoured him, which allowed them to gain a portion of his strength. The totem meal, which is our earliest festival, commemorates this criminal deed. Furthermore, totemism was the beginning of social organization, moral restrictions, and religion (1913 [1989:176]).

After the brothers killed the father, they took for themselves the father’s women who have been set free, offenses that mirror, at a collective level, the repressed Oedipal desires of the male child. But soon, the affection toward him which the brother had pushed aside made itself felt. Here, a “sense of guilt” appeared, coinciding with the remorse the whole group felt. Out of this sense of guilt, the brothers created two fundamental taboos: first, the incest taboo, which implied a renunciation of the father’s women and not having sexual relations with a woman of the same totem (exogamy), which allowed the brothers to set aside their rivalry and band together. Second, the taboo to kill the totem animal which served as a substitute for the father. To preclude the possibility that what happened to the father might happen to them, they added to the religiously based prohibition to kill the totem animal the socially based prohibition against fratricide, which was called “Thou shalt do no murder.”

The prohibitions on incest and murder, thus, have a common origin and emerge simultaneously. Together, they mandate the social processes of exogamy (marriage outside one’s kin) and totemism (communal bonds of affiliation established through the medium of a common ancestor). Furthermore, the two taboo prohibitions coincide in their content with the two crimes of Oedipus, who killed his father and married his mother. Therefore, the totemic system was a product of the conditions involved in the Oedipus complex (1913 [1989:164]).

Totemism and exogamy engendered fraternal equality: in order for no one take the place of the father and assume his singular power, the brothers were equally constrained and equally respected. In the Freudian narrative, it is merely the father/son relationship that seems to matter for the establishment of equality amongst brothers, and women merely serve as objects of exchange. However, Freud also explains that the primal horde is the story of the beginning of patriarchy. He points out that totemism marks the beginning where a matriarchal organization of the family was replaced with a patriarchal one (1913 [1989:179]).

Furthermore, Freud points out that great mother goddesses may have preceded the father-gods that the brothers created to atone for their killing of the father (1913 [1989:185]). The brothers introduced the totem as the first father surrogate and later created father-deities to bring about a reconciliation with the murdered father. It results from their sense of guilt and an attempt to calm that feeling and appease the father by deferring obedience to him. The elevation of the murdered father into a totem and father-deity tallowed the brothers to submit to his authority to atone for their deed.

However, such elevation also marked the beginning of a patriarchal organization of society. As Freud points out that “with the introduction of father-deities a fatherless society gradually changed into one organized on a patriarchal basis. The family was a restoration of the former primal horde and it gives back to fathers a large portion of their former rights” (1913 [1989:185]). The introduction of the patriarchal system and dominance of the father’s authority at its climax allowed the deposed father to took harsh revenge for being eliminated earlier.

Freud points out that the son’s rebelliousness never became extinct. For example, in the Christian communion the guilty deed toward the father is commemorated and repeated (1913 [1989:192]). However, what Freud did not hint at is the daughter’s rebelliousness against the establishment of the patriarchal order, in which they were allotted a secondary position below men, which brings us to feminist critiques and appropriations of Freudian psychoanalysis in the next section.

Freud also addresses patriarchy in his Jokes and Their Relation to the Unconscious (1905). In general, Freud makes a core distinction between humor and tendentious jokes, which are hostile and obscene jokes. In Humor (1927), he points out that while humor is located in the preconscious, jokes are in the unconscious. While humor has a transformative potential because here the super-ego is less stern and allows us a small amount of pleasure to alleviate our suffering, tendentious jokes produce pleasure in us because they lift repressions and allow us to temporarily relieve our aggressive impulses (via hostile or racist jokes) and direct libidinal impulses (via sexually aggressive jokes), which we have repressed into our unconscious, into our ego, and this generates vast amounts of pleasure in us.

Freud points out that over the course of civilization, we have had to repress our libido and aggression. Aggressive and obscene jokes provide a means of undoing the renunciation and retrieving what was lost. In relation to obscene jokes, a man develops a “hostile trend against that second person,” a woman, because she has rejected his sexual advances, which left his libidinal drive inhibited. Here, the man makes a joke, which takes the woman as the object of sexual aggressiveness. As the joke exposes and shames the woman, it allows the man to retrieve lost sexual pleasure. Freud’s argument that “women’s incapacity to tolerate undisguised sexuality” turns men into sexual aggressors via jokes is problematic, because it makes women responsible for men’s sexual aggression toward them (1905 [2013:144]). However, he also outlines that men’s laughter at an obscene joke is cruel toward the woman, as the man “is laughing as though as he were the spectator of an act of sexual aggression” (1905 [2013:139).

In addition, Freud shows us that besides the man, who makes the joke, and the woman, who is the object of sexual aggressiveness, the sexually aggressive joke also needs an outside person, the third person, to whom the joke is communicated, for its completion. Here obscene (or sexually aggressive) jokes bribe the listener (the third person) with an effortless satisfaction of his libido to side with the maker of the joke. The joke exposes the woman “before the third, who, as a listener, has now been bribed by the effortless satisfaction of his own libido.” (1905 [2013:143). While the listener to the joke might initially not harbor any conscious sexist tendencies, he becomes bribed with an easy yield of pleasure to take sides with the joke’s maker. Furthermore, to avoid upsetting the pleasure derived from tendentious jokes, there’s an incentive for the follower not to reflect on the content of such jokes critically, which generates an uncritical attitude in the listener.

2. Feminist Critiques and Appropriations of Freudian Psychoanalysis

Even in Freud’s circle, not all analysts agreed with Freud’s assessment, and there were debates concerning women’s sexuality and the roles of castration and penis envy therein, notably among Karl Abraham, Ernest Jones, Helene Deutsch, and Karen Horney. Horney (2000), in particular, argued for an inherent feminine disposition that is not merely a secondary formation premised on castration, and she took issue with the ostensible effects of penis envy and women’s supposed feelings of inferiority. As with some later feminist criticisms of Freud, Horney attempted to retrieve female sexuality, and by extension a valid form of feminine existence, by appealing to a genuinely independent nature and holding culture culpable for women’s subordinate status. By thus reasserting the primacy of biological and social forces, however, Horney disputes precisely the idea that is central to Freud’s hypothesis and that marks psychoanalysis as a unique field of inquiry, that of a distinctive psychical realm of representation that is unconscious.

Somewhat later, Simone de Beauvoir addressed the discourse of psychoanalysis in the French context in The Second Sex (1949), devoting an early chapter to her distrust of “The Psychoanalytic Point of View” (Beauvoir 1949 [1989: 38–52]). Like Horney, Beauvoir denounces Freud’s idea that there is but one masculine libido and no feminine libido with “its own original nature” (1949 [1989: 39]). Beauvoir takes Freud to task for not considering the social origins of masculine and paternal power and privilege and deems his theory inadequate to account for woman’s otherness. If women envy men, she argues, it is because of the social power and privilege they enjoy and not because of anatomical superiority. For Beauvoir, Freudian psychoanalysis presents the characteristics of femininity and subjectivity as divergent paths incompatible with one another. Women might be able to be full persons, subjects with agency, but only at the expense of their femininity; or they can embark on the course of femininity, but only by sacrificing their independence and agency.

Beauvoir’s project of elucidating the paradoxical relation between femininity and subjectivity is nonetheless influenced by psychoanalytic concepts and appropriates its theoretical insights in various ways. The Second Sex highlights the practices by which women become women through their appropriation of bodily (sexual) difference, as well as the manner in which a human being generally is limited and compelled by bodily and unconscious forces. Indeed, Beauvoir and Freud seem to agree that one is not born but becomes a woman, i.e., that femininity involves some (social or psychical) process rather than a biological or natural given. Both are interested in the “how” of this process, how one becomes a woman, although they disagree about this “how”. Furthermore, for Beauvoir, as for Freud, there is no such thing as a disembodied, non-sexed human being; any ideal of the human apart from sexual identity or difference is an abstraction that can only be affirmed on the basis of a mind/body dualism. Also, like Freud, Beauvoir is fully aware of the impact on children of their domestic situation, the way familial life resonates with meaning that informs not only intimate relations but relations to the larger world.

There are also later feminist appropriations of Freudian psychoanalysis. The Canadian psychoanalytic feminist Irene Fast, in her Gender Identity: A Differentiation Model (1984), draws on Freud’s idea of an initial undifferentiated and bisexual phase to rethink gender identity but also departs from it. While Freud suggests that girls and boys assume that they are “male” in the undifferentiated phase and that the development of femininity is a rejection of an early masculinity, Fast assumes that children internalize a broad spectrum of attributes of their environment in the undifferentiated phase, regardless of whether they are ascribed to the “female” or “male” gender. In such a phase, the child does not have any feeling whether it is “female” or “male.” Instead, the child has the narcissistic experience of unlimited possibilities that are not limited by gender (Fast 1984 [1991: 24]). Furthermore, the child assumes not only that mothers have a penis, as Freud argued, but also that the fathers can have babies. Around the second half of the second year, the child, through educational practices, realizes that certain characteristics cannot or are not allowed to be their own.

Here the child starts to identify itself and others as “female” or “male” and rejects attributes that are ascribed to the other sex. The girl has to accept that she does not have a penis and those aspects of her self that are not in line with her gender. The boy has to give up the idea that he can bear babies and those aspects of his self that are not in line with his gender, which is, according to Fast, harder for the boy than the girl. The girl and the boy experience a loss, to have to give up attributes they considered as their own through early identifications (Fast 1984 [1991: 18]). Here, the girl’s “penis envy” becomes a symbol of having to give up intellectual precocity, bodily strength and the expression of aggression. Also, the girl’s wanting a penis is not a demand for a return to “masculinity” as Freud claims, but stands for the demand to return to the experience of unlimited possibilities in the undifferentiated phase (Fast 1984 [1991: 29]). Furthermore, similarly to Freud, Fast argues that the child never fully accepts the gendered boundaries that have been put upon her, which we can see in the arts, ceremonies, and emotional disturbances of the adult.

The German feminist psychoanalyst Christa Rhode-Dachser, in her Expeditionen in the dunklen Kontinent (Expeditions into the Dark Continent, 1991) reveals the unconscious phantasies that we find not only in Freud’s theory of femininity but also in central psychoanalytic categories. Such unconscious phantasies express a gender ideology that contains hierarchical male/female dichotomies, where the male is set prior to and above the female. Such gender ideology is not merely the expression of the unconscious of the author (Freud and later psychoanalytic thinkers) but the expression of a collective unconscious in a patriarchal society. For her, the psychoanalytic theory of unconscious processes provides a key for understanding unconscious phantasies in psychoanalytic texts. Such unconscious phantasies reflect dominant societal imaginations of femininity and masculinity and deliver normative measurements for the unmasculine and unfeminine, which are central to socialization of men and women who reproduce patriarchal society.

For Rhode-Dachser, femininity in psychoanalysis implies a “container function” – it refers to an an imaginary room that is declared as feminine and sharply distinguished from the world of men. Man projects into this imaginary room his anxieties, wishes, desires – everything that he is not allowed and does not want to be so that it is preserved in this way and he can always return to it (Rhode-Dachser 1991: 100). Such unconscious phantasies establish the identity of men and their place in patriarchal society – he is what she is not. In addition, they legitimize the existing societal gender arrangement where men occupy a dominant position. While most psychoanalytic feminists have challenged Freud’s idea of a masculine libido, Rhode-Dachser shows us that we find in Freud’s and later psychoanalytic texts, more broadly, masculinity associated with life (libido and the ego) and femininity with death (the death drive and the unconscious). Such unconscious phantasies express men’s fears of death and their desire for immortality. As she puts it, “what the man fears (castration, dependency, bodily deficiencies, death) is projected onto the woman, and now in her pitied, despised and denied” (1991: 138). As the conqueror of death, the man now stands firmly on the side of life.

The Austrian American psychoanalytic feminist Else Frenkel-Brunswik employs a feminist approach in her contributions to The Authoritarian Personality (1950 [2019]). This study, which was conducted in the United States of America by a group of psychoanalysts and critical theorists, draws on Freudian psychoanalysis to explore the origins of fascism not merely as a political phenomenon but as the manifestation of dispositions that lie at the very core of the modern psyche. The study explains how such dispositions make people susceptible to fascist propaganda. Frenkel-Brunswik explains that authoritarian family structures, which are the result of economic societal structures, with rigid gender roles and a dominating father figure, generate dispositions in children (and later adults) who cannot admit ambiguity (such as the ambiguity of our gender identity), which make them susceptible to fascist propaganda.

Frenkel-Brunswik outlines two interconnected reasons why people cannot admit ambiguity: the lack of an internalized superego and an overwhelming aggression drive. Unlike Freud, who suggests that the outcome of the Oedipal complex allows only the boy to internalize a superego, Frenkel-Brunswik points out that in an authoritarian family, neither the boy nor the girl can internalize the superego. The reason for this is that in an authoritarian family, the child cannot establish a genuine identification with her parents, which would allow him to internalize the moral standards of the adult world and generate an internalized superego. Instead, the child develops an externalized superego, meaning that its behavior is not guided by internal standards but by external authority figures. Since the child does not have an internalized superego that keeps her libidinal and aggressive drives in check, the id drives are in danger of breaking through at any time.

In addition, in authoritarian families, parents do not enable their children to work through their unconscious drives, which could allow them to integrate such drives. Furthermore, because the child is forced to fearfully submit to parental authority, she develops a considerable amount of aggression towards the parents, which she, however, cannot admit and must repress. To cope with that danger of id impulses breaking through, the child (and later adult) develops a simple, often stereotypical, cognitive and emotional structure that allows them to avoid ambiguity. Women and (men) who cannot admit ambiguity are drawn to fascism because it offers them rigid binaries, including rigid male/female, friend/enemy, and ingroup/outgroup binaries that allow them to fend off ambiguity and provide them with outlets (fascism’s declared enemies) for their aggression, even if such binaries reinforce women’s oppression. Here, fascist groups come to replace the parents as the external authority figures who dictate how to think and act.

Another Austrian American psychoanalytic feminist, Claudia Leeb, in her Contesting the Far Right: A Psychoanalytic and Feminist Critical Theory Approach (2024), draws on Freud’s theory of mass psychology and adds an analysis of capitalism to explain the recruitment tactics of the far right today. As outlined above, the ego ideal is the ideal view we have about ourselves and what we aspire to be like. In capitalist societies, economic, interpersonal, and bodily success standards create our ego ideal. However, objective conditions of suffering in precarity capitalism, the inability to get or keep a job, growing exploitation, alienation, and isolation make it difficult, if not impossible, for most people to live up to such standards. Therefore, objective conditions of suffering in capitalism generate subjective forms of suffering in people around their non-whole subjectivities, which they experience as a tension between their ego and their ego ideal with accompanying castration anxieties and feelings of failure.

Far-right propaganda catches such suffering people because it allows them to undo the tension between their ego and their ego ideal. Once the ego coincides again with the ego ideal, they experience an “ecstatic high” that allows them in a dream-like and hallucinatory manner to feel as a “whole” subject again and believe that they achieved economic, interpersonal, and bodily success, which allows them to get rid of feelings of castration anxiety and failure. Meanwhile, the objective conditions of suffering in capitalism that generated their subjective forms of suffering in the first place remain intact or become further entrenched by the far right. Leeb also shows that white men from all classes are especially vulnerable to psychologically oriented far-right recruitment tactics because we expect them to live up to success standards, which has become (despite their white, male and bourgeois privileges) difficult to accomplish for them in precarity capitalism. The same psychological processes that make the followers feel “whole” again also engender a regression to a hypnotic state, where their unconscious attitude predominates, and they subordinate themselves to the destructive will of the leader or the movement.

Furthermore, the psychological processes that allow the followers to undo the tension between their ego and their ego ideal also put their super-ego, which is the mental instance in us that keeps our repressed libidinal and aggressive drives in check, temporarily (or for prolonged periods) out of action. The far right utilizes the libidinal drive to strengthen the libidinal ties between the mass followers and the leader and redirects the followers’ aggression towards its chosen foes (migrants, and immigrants). Both processes allow for the integration of individuals into the far-right mass. Leeb shows that in a far-right mass with an identifiable leader, the followers undo the split between their ego and their ego ideal by replacing their ego ideal with the idealized leader figure. In contrast, in a far-right mass without an identifiable leader figure, the movement’s use of specific propaganda techniques (such as racist and sexist jokes, which she explains via Freud’s critical theory of tendentious jokes outlined above) fulfills a similar function.

3. Lacanian Psychoanalysis

In considering the background of psychoanalytic feminism, a large portion of which is rooted in or aligned with what is called French Feminism (which I will discuss below), the French context of psychoanalytic theory is also crucial, particularly the work of Jacques Lacan. Lacan characterizes his work as fundamentally a return to Freud, albeit one that brings the insights of structural linguistics, especially Ferdinand de Saussure and Roman Jakobson, and structural anthropology, primarily Claude Lévi-Strauss, into the domain of psychoanalysis. Even so, his returns are also revisions; he not only retrieves but renovates Freud’s central concepts.

To better understand the feminist appropriation of Lacanian theory, I will concentrate on outlining the imaginary, the symbolic and the real, which are the three core theoretical concepts or domains through which Lacan mapped his thought. Lacan focused his early works on elaborating the imaginary. Starting from his Rome address “The Function and Field of Speech and Language in Psychoanalysis” (1953), Lacan shifted to explaining the symbolic. From The Ethics of Psychoanalysis (1986), he engaged more deeply with the real. However, it would be misguided to assume a chronology of these concepts since Lacan returned and reworked them. Whereas the imaginary relation refers to the relation between the ego and images, the symbolic domain refers to the relation between the subject and signifiers – language and speech. While the advent of the symbolic order is tied to Oedipalization, and the imaginary order is tied to the pre-Oedipal period, it would be mistaken to think of the imaginary and symbolic in only developmental or chronological terms as they are also ongoing structures of experience.

The imaginary order is elucidated in Lacan’s essay “The Mirror Stage as Formative of the I Function as Revealed in Psychoanalytic Experience.” The mirror stage commences pre-Oedipally, between the age of six and eighteen months, before the beginning of articulate speech. The subject (or the infant) is at this age without speech, bodily coordination or motor control, and the capacity for self-care. The mirror stage is the original adventure where the subject finds, for the first time, what Lacan calls “an imaginary mastery” over the body (Lacan, 1975a [1991a: 79]). This mastery is imaginary because it is premature in relation to real mastery. The subject, who experiences her body at this stage as “disconnected, discordant, in pieces,” finds an anticipatory mastery via identification with an idealized “whole” image of an other with a small o (autre, symbolized as a’), which is both the subject’s own image in the mirror and the image of a fellow human being (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 50]). Lacan distinguishes this other with a small o from the big Other with a capital O (Autre, symbolized as A), the symbolic domain.

The mirror stage is the original adventure that allows the subject through identification with an other, for the first time, the experience of “conceiving of [her/]himself as other than [s/]he is,” which Lacan underlines with the statement that in the imaginary the “I is an other (Je est un autre)” (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 7]). However, the mirror stage is not merely a stage in the development of the subject. Instead, for Lacan the relation of the ego to the other is an essential structure of the human constitution, because “there is always something of that [the non-wholeness] that remains” (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 50]). The mirror stage means that the subject cannot achieve a whole ego via the identification with an other with a small o. Instead, on the imaginary plane, we are confronted with the fundamental precariousness of the subject’s ego, which threatens to dissolve at any moment. As Lacan puts it, the ego is merely an “ideal unity, which is never attained as such and escapes him at every moment” (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 20]). This fundamental precariousness has consequences for both the subject and the other.

On the side of the subject, we find the subject’s continuing attempts to reach an impossible wholeness through successive identifications with an idealized whole other with a small o, which builds up a rigid ego with a “donned armor of an alienating identity” (Lacan 1966 [2006: 6]). Since the subject is in a state of dependence relative to an idealized, forced image of itself (the mirror image) or the image of another human being, the notion of an “autonomous ego” is merely a deception on the imaginary plane, where alienation prevails. The mirror stage also forms the basis of Lacan’s critique of ego psychology; whereas the latter takes strengthening the ego to be the aim of analytic practice, Lacan takes the aspirations of the ego to be a “lure” of self-possession, an armor that rigidifies the subject, a defensive structure that provides an alienating identity.

Yet it is not only the subject for whom the imaginary relation results in alienation. It is also the other, the fellow human being, from whom the subject expects to find her wholeness, who suffers in the imaginary relation. The central Lacanian statement that “the ego is the other, and the other is me (moi)” means that the subject, in her attempt to reach an impossible wholeness via identification with an other, reduces the other to itself, which leads to destruction and a negation of the other (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 95]. Because the ego is the other in the imaginary, the other needs to be reduced to me to sustain the illusion of a whole.

In the imaginary domain, we also encounter the narcissistic character of love relationships where the other is reduced to the functions of the ego: “It is one’s own ego that one loves in love, one’s own ego made real on the imaginary level” (Lacan 1975a [1991a: 62–3]. He also outlines an aggressive tension as the result of the narcissistic structure of the “coming-into-being of the subject” via the other. Since the wholeness of the subject comes about via a foreign idealized whole image of an other, aggression is the irreducible accompaniment of the relation of the I to the other, which easily turns into “It’s either me or you.” Since any departure from the idealized “whole” through which the subject finds her imaginary wholeness threatens to destroy the subject, the other must remain reduced to me (Lacan 1966 [2006: 22]).

However, the imaginary relation is not merely a stage in the development of the subject. Instead, since the subject will never be completely unified precisely because this is brought about in an alienating way, in the form of a foreign image, Lacan argues, “[t]he aggressive tension of this either me or the other is entirely integrated into every kind of imaginary functioning in [wo]man” (Lacan 1981 [1993: 95]). Therefore, whenever we find ourselves on the imaginary plane, we encounter an aggressive tension between the subject and the other. The good news that Lacan brings us is that it never gets to the point of radical destruction. There is always something else that intervenes in the imaginary relation.

At this point that we encounter the Lacanian big Other, the symbolic domain. Whereas on the imaginary plane, the subject identifies with a whole idealized image of an other, in the symbolic order she identifies with a symbol, the signifier, which allows her a certain consistency and stability. In the symbolic order, the subject, not the ego, is born. Therefore, the subject can set herself up as “operating, as human, as I, from the moment the symbolic system appears” (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 52]. Lacan argues that the symbolic order is the result of generations and was there long before we came into the world. Therefore, for individuals to become subjects, they have to submit to it, much more than they constitute it.

The problem for Lacan is that the symbolic order consists of signifiers that subjects have erected as fixed. Such a rigid symbolic order has consequences for the subject, who has to submit to the symbolic order to become a subject. Since the signifier “governs whatever may be made present in the subject” (Lacan 1973 [1977: 198], a signifier that has been erected as a fixed entity allows certain aspects to be made present in the subject but not others. As a consequence, for the subject to become a subject, she needs to suppress all those other aspects that the signifier denies. At the moment when the subject emerges via her subjection to the signifier, the unconscious makes its appearance as that which could not be made present in the subject, because the signifier forecloses it.

In Book XI, Lacan explains subject formation with the double function of the signifier that “functions as a signifier only to reduce the subject in question to no more than a signifier, to petrify the subject in the same movement in which it calls the subject to function, to speak, as subject” (Lacan 1973 [1977: 207]). For example, identification with the signifier “woman” allows an individual to function and to speak as a “woman.” However, this solidification into a signifier is, according to Lacan, especially problematic for women, since the signifier “woman” is linked to a whole chain of signifiers in patriarchy – including the body, the object, passivity and so on. “Speech remains,” he warns us: “You can’t help the play of symbols, and that is why you must be very careful what you say.” (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 198]). The problem is that subjects are very careful about what they say, especially regarding women. Lacan elucidates this in relation to the androcentric character of the symbolic order, which for him is unacceptable precisely because women “are entirely subjected to it [the symbolic order] no less than the men” (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 262]).

Although the signifier “woman” (and “man”) is like all signifiers, empty and merely deceiving us over what there is to signify, this signifier exists and determines what can be made present in women. Lacan argues that fixed signifiers lead to the petrified pain of subjects who must submit to these signifiers to become subjects. Although the symbolic order allows the subject a certain consistency and stability (which is precarious in the imaginary), Lacan insists that this identification with the signifier still does not allow the subject to become entirely whole either. Although the “signifier alone guarantees the theoretical coherence of the whole as a whole,” this coherence is only theoretical (Lacan 1966 [2006: 25]). Since the signifier itself is always non-whole, any identification with it results in a non-whole or fundamentally lacking subject.

Here, we have arrived at the third domain that Lacan introduces – the domain of the real. The real does not refer to any reality. On the contrary, it tells us we can never reach such a reality. The real is linked to the imaginary and the symbolic, but it is neither symbolic nor imaginary. Its constitution lies at the juncture of the symbolic and the imaginary. The real is an element in the symbolic that resists absolute symbolization. As he puts it, the real tells us that there is “a fault, a hole” in the big Other (the symbolic order) and its signifiers (1975b [1998]: 28). The real is the gap, the unnameable, and the limit of discourse and the fissure in the symbolic order that points to that which is beyond meaning.

Although the signifier in the symbolic order brings the subject into being (through identification with the signifier), the signifier can never completely determine our subjectivity because there is a hole in the big Other. Furthermore, because there is a fundamental hole in the signifier, the subject remains “a subject-with-holes” (sujet troué) in the symbolic order, which Lacan considers as a traumatic moment (1973 [1977]: 182). Remaining a subject-with-holes creates desires (the desire for wholeness) and anxieties (the anxiety of never reaching any wholeness). Here, Lacan introduces the concept of objet petit a (“object little a”), which is the historically contingent unconscious fantasy object through which we obtain the illusion of wholeness.

Furthermore, throughout his “Seminar on Feminine Sexuality” Lacan makes the puzzling statement that “there is no such thing as a sexual relationship” (Lacan 1975b [1998: 7, 47, 61–2]). This statement does not refer to the impossibility of sexual relations as such, as Luce Irigaray (who will be discussed below) has argued, but to the impossibility of stating what sexual difference implies. In the Lacanian schema of sexuation, sexual difference stands for the real, which implies that every attempt to define “woman” via a set of “static” symbolic oppositions to “man” (such as active/passive) always refers to a surplus, something that does not fit into this opposition. In Book XI, he argues that the “masculine/feminine opposition is never attained” and that there is, as such, “nothing by which the subject may situate [her/]himself as a male or female being” (Lacan 1973 [1977: 192, 204]).

In “The Instance of the Letter in the Unconscious,” a chapter in Ecrits, Lacan illustrates the impossibility of reducing sexual difference to binary oppositions grounded in some “real” properties. Explaining the “laws of urinary segregation,” which refers here to the gendered separation of toilets, Lacan replaces the Saussurian scheme of a single signifier (the word “tree” above the bar) and the signified (the drawing of a tree below the bar) with a pair of signifiers: we see two words (“ladies” and “gentlemen”) next to each other above a bar (signifying sexual difference) (Lacan 1966 [2006: 143]).

The surprise here is that, below the bar, we see two identical drawings of a door. This illustration underlines that sexual difference does not designate any “real” oppositions between the sexes. Instead, it refers to a purely symbolic opposition to which nothing corresponds in the designated objects but the real (the bar), which the image of the signified cannot ever capture. For Lacan (similarly to Freud), there is, for example, no reason to say that the woman is passive and the man is active. In the Lacanian sense, this is not discernible so long as the definitions are not laid down.

However, sexed oppositions have an effect on reality, which Lacan explains with the story of a girl and a boy who arrive in a train at a station. They are seated across from each other in a train compartment next to the outside window that provides a view of the platform buildings going by. The moment the train stops the boy says, “‘Look…we’re at Ladies!’ ‘Imbecile!’ replies the girl, ‘Don’t you see we’re at Gentlemen’” (Lacan 1966 [2006: 143]). The signifier of sexual difference (ladies and gentlemen) fails to signify any “real” difference between the girl and the boy (the signified). However, from now on the girl and the boy have to find their bearing therein, which, precisely because it is impossible to say what this difference is, will, according to Lacan, raise dissension between the sexes “to the immeasurable power of ideological warfare” (Lacan 1966 [2006: 144]). Since it is impossible for the ones signified (the boy and the girl) to agree upon what these terms “ladies” and “gentlemen” imply or to reach up to their significations, the hegemonic struggle for determining the signifier’s meanings is opened up.

In “The Signification of the Phallus,” Lacan also addresses and criticizes the alternative view to Freud’s argument that there is only one masculine libido – that there might be two libidos, which he satirizes as a kind of sexual equality that essentializes masculinity and femininity (Lacan 1966 [2006: 577]). Lacan also criticizes the idea that in the final stage of genital sexuality, men’s and women’s sexual interests converge, and points out that Freud understood “the essential disturbance of human sexuality” (1966 [2006: 575]). Such disturbance means that there is no symmetrical or harmonious sexual relation between well-integrated and self-realized men and women. However, we encounter in Lacan also gendered metaphors. For example, in his early works, he declares that “there’s no such thing as Woman, Woman with a capital W indicating the universal” (1975b [1998: 72]).

Here he asserts that the signifier “woman” does not imply any determinate or substantive content. Symbolic representations leave something out and produce an impasse that presents a fracture or fissure in the symbolic order. Although Lacan aims to show us here that sexual difference cannot be fully contained within its terms, it remains a problem that it is “woman” who is associated with the domain of the real, which he also associates with lack.

Gendered metaphors also appear in his elaboration of the symbolic domain. Lacan points out that Freud’s theory of sexuality anticipates a theory of signification that he could not yet elaborate. Following the logic of Totem and Taboo, social bonds are maintained through mandates and prohibitions (what is required and what is forbidden), and in particular through the mandate of exogamy which determines that “the Oedipus complex is both universal and contingent” (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 33]). For Lacan, paternal prohibition provides the conditions for human sociality without the prohibition itself being innate.

Lacan calls the paternal prohibition (the incest taboo) the “law of the father,” and he develops the connection between law and language by way of a pun. In French, non (“no”) and nom (“name”) sound alike. The “no” that prohibits (the father’s law) and the name that establishes authority (the father’s name or the proper name), are conferred simultaneously. By submitting to the law of the father (his no and name) the child becomes a subject, bound by law and bearer of language. With this compliance, the child takes on a life of desire and incompletion, pursuing lost objects with no firm ground or fixed purpose, a lack of plenitude in being that Lacan designates as castration.

As discussed above in the section on Freud, Freud understands women to be “castrated,” deprived of a penis, and men to live under the threat of castration. Lacan complicates this perspective by deeming all subjects to be castrated, by which he means deprived of the phallus, which is not the same as the penis. While the penis is a biological organ, the phallus is a signifier, not an image or bodily organ, and in relation to it, all are castrated. According to Lacan, the phallus instates the signifier into the subject regardless of any “anatomical distinction between the sexes” (Lacan 1966 [2006: 576]). Lacan also challenges Freud’s idea of women’s “penis-envy” and asserts that it is “in so far as the woman is in the symbolic order with an androcentric perspective that the penis takes on this value. Besides, it isn’t the penis, but the phallus” (Lacan 1978 [1991b: 272)].

Here, Lacan de-biologizes Freud since he articulates the function of the phallus apart from any particular bodily attributes. Castration takes place when the child recognizes lack in the mother, and her maternal omnipotence is annulled. The mother, for the child, ceases to be the all-powerful provider of every satisfaction as she herself is a desiring being deprived of satisfaction (Lacan 1966 [2006: 582]). Galvanized by the mother’s lack, the law of the father takes the place of the mother’s desire, substitutes for it and occludes it. In the Lacanian version of the Oedipal Complex, human beings achieve a sexual position by traversing the Oedipal Complex, i.e., by submitting to castration, also called the phallic function, and thereby entering into the symbolic domain.

The father’s “No” effectively says to the child: “you are not the object of the mother’s desire” or “you are not her phallus, the thing that fulfills her.” As such, it also conveys the message that the child too, is lacking or desiring. Lacan distinguishes between a “seeming to be” which characterizes femininity, in the attempt to be the phallus that one is not (to be the object of desire), from a “seeming to have” which characterizes masculinity in the attempt to have the phallus that one does not have (to possess the object of desire). However, he still maintains that everyone is lacking the phallus in some way, either in the mode of not being it or in the mode of not having it.

In his later works, Lacan equates the “phallus” with the real. Here, he reiterates that the phallus does not denote any positive meaning. Rather, it signifies the moment when meaning “slips ways, runs off, escapes all those barriers that oppose it, including precisely those that are the most essential, those that are constituted by the agency of the signifier” (Lacan 1986 [1992]: 314). For Lacan, the phallus is fallible, which he underlines by equating the phallus with the bar (which refers to the real) between the signifier and the signified. Furthermore, in his Seminar on X on anxiety, Lacan links the phallus to anxiety (Lacan 2004 [2016]). Here explains that the fact that the phallus is not found where we expect and require it to be and that it merely appears as lack underlines that sexuality is linked with anxiety. Insofar as we expect men to have the phallus, which signifies lack, it is particularly men who are plagued with anxieties around their sexuality.

The Slovenian psychoanalytic feminist thinker Renata Salecl points out that although the phallus is on the side of men in Lacan’s work, men cannot be happy about that because the phallus refers to an image whose reality is its incompleteness, which creates anxieties in men who are expected to have the phallus (Salecl 2002). Elizabeth Grosz further explains that the incompleteness of the phallus, which we demand from men to have, generates men’s “anxieties about sexual performance (impotence fears) as well as a sometimes desperate search for the other through whom the man can have his position as the possessor of the valued/desired organ confirmed” (Grosz 1990: 118).

Despite Lacan’s attempts to de-essentialize the meaning of the phallus and feminist attempts to read the phallus as the impossibility of signifying sexual difference, Lacan remains implicated in the symbolic order with an androcentric perspective (or a certain “phallogocentrism” as outlined by French psychoanalytic feminists, as we shall see in the next section) since the phallus retains its associations with masculinity and remains the focal point of sexual identity. Nonetheless, feminist thinkers have also found fruitful resources in Lacan’s theoretical framework to rethink sexual difference, and the meaning of “woman” and “femininity.”

4. French Feminism

French Feminism is in many ways a misnomer since the authors thus characterized are rarely of French origin or nationality (although French is the predominant language of their writing) and not necessarily overtly self-identified as feminist. The writers affiliated with French Feminism, including Luce Irigaray, Julia Kristeva, Sarah Kofman, Catherine Clément, and Hélène Cixous, among others, variously ask about the relation between the maternal and the feminine, doubt that we can say what a woman is, worry about Freud’s lack of attention to mothers, play with writing style, wonder about feminine subjectivity, ask if women can be subjects or citizens without adapting to masculine norms, challenge Lacan’s phallocentrism, and suspect that access to language assimilates women into neutralized brothers.

They are sympathetic to the split of subjectivity detailed by psychoanalysis and ask whether the structures of femininity and the structures of subjectivity are compatible, commensurable, reconcilable, and they are vexed by the apprehension that they are fundamentally at odds. While they aim to disentangle femininity from maternity and provide a critique of their conflation, they also take seriously the significance of maternity for women and for children of both sexes. Because they take femininity and the feminine body as points of departure for speech and writing, they have often been accused of essentialism. The focus below is on the work of Irigaray and Kristeva, examining how they engage with and transform the ideas of Freud and Lacan and how they articulate sexual difference as integrally connected to the foundation and disruption of the symbolic order.

4.1 The Impasse of Feminine Subjectivity

Irigaray characterizes her own project as taking place in three stages: first, deconstructing the masculine subject; second, figuring out the possibility for a feminine subject; and third, construing an intersubjectivity that respects sexual difference (Irigaray 1995a: 96). Sexual difference, in her view, is not a system of domination to be overcome but a cultural process and practice to be achieved and nourished; the actual relations of domination and subordination that characterize Western politics, society, history, literature, language, and law epitomize for Irigaray the reign of sexual indifference, the fraternal order of equal brothers/citizens that is inattentive to sexual differentiation. Irigaray’s writings implicate Freud in this culture of sexual indifference, as will be elaborated further below.

Irigaray’s writing style is often mimetic, an approach that she claims has been “historically assigned to the feminine” (Irigaray 1977 [1985b: 76]). Irigaray’s writing does not proceed propositionally, laying down theses and supporting arguments, nor is it formulated through conventionally linear explanations. Instead, she reaches her insights and conclusions by mirroring the text she is reading, allowing it to play out its contradictions, and putting its parapraxes (its textual and conceptual slips of the tongue) on display. By exposing the unconscious logic of a text, and revealing the author’s underlying fantasies and anxieties, she aims to loosen the masculine hold on the symbolic order. Intently attentive to the signifier, to the words and silences of psychoanalytic texts, she aims to retrieve the bodily in language and to invent a new language and imagine new forms.

Speculum of the Other Woman (her dissertation and the work that got her exiled from the Lacanian school) includes “The Blind Spot of an Old Dream of Symmetry,” Irigaray’s long essay on Freud’s writings on femininity. Irigaray’s essay on Freud begins by tackling head-on his articulation of the riddle of femininity in his lecture on “Femininity” (Irigaray 1974 [1985a: 13]). Here already, we can recognize not only Irigaray’s unique style and her critical project but also the way these two features of her writing are imbricated and entangled with one another, propelling a distinctively mimetic method of reading, repeating, and reproducing the text, mirroring Freud’s speculative discourse but also transforming and sabotaging its terms.

Her text opens with Freud’s words, and is comprised of long quotations that follow the course of Freud’s essay. Insofar as this appropriation might at first appear as the passive listening of a dutiful daughter, Irigaray performs a kind of masquerade of femininity: receptive, submissive, obedient. But this performance does not merely reiterate or reproduce; in exemplifying the ways in which women have no language of their own, and can only speak in or through the voice of the father, she is establishing the symbolic terrain upon which any critique must move while also subverting its presuppositions. Her words are inserted as commentary, question, and counterpoint, breaking open the Freudian text, usurping its privileges, and revealing its wounds. By engaging Freud in a conversation, she insists on her status as a speaking subject.

Although Freud’s lecture had ventured to complicate rather than simplify certainties concerning sexual difference, Irigaray, however, by retrieving and replaying Freud’s voice, attempts to show that he remains caught up in certainties about sex, so that ultimately, his discourse is one of sexual indifference. Freud’s work is sexually indifferent because of its assumption of a kind of symmetry or harmony between masculine and feminine identities and sexualities. With regard to sexual desire, Freud assumes that “normal” women will desire men and be desired by them and thus that each sex can fulfill the longings of the other.

Irigaray suggests that with regard to sexual identity, Freud models the feminine Oedipal Complex on a masculine origin and paradigm, with the feminine as its distorted copy. Freud understands women as the complementary other to men, an other modeled on the same. Irigaray considers this to be a monosexual, homosocial economy governed by specular opposition or mirroring. The speculum is a metaphor for the mirror that reflects male-centric philosophy, psychoanalysis, and culture, which positions women and the feminine as mere distorted and lacking images of the masculine norm, rather than individuals with a genuine feminine subjectivity. She references this sexual indifference in the title of her essay as “the old dream of symmetry.” Irigaray believes this dream is premised on a “blindspot” - Freud characterizes the girl’s relation to the maternal figure as an “especially inexorable repression” (Freud 1931 [1968: 226]) and views the little girl as a little man.

Irigaray suggests that the mother/daughter relation is not seen or apprehended by Freud. The crime here, in her view, is matricide and the suppression of maternal genealogies or lines of descent. The law of the father, the patrimonial order by which sons inherit the father’s name by submitting to his prohibitions, privileging this name over the maternal body, appropriates even birth to the father. The maternal lineage is suppressed. Irigaray argues that this means that a pre-Oedipal mother-daughter relationship has not been taken up by the signifying order; in fact that order retroactively denies that such a relation ever existed, since a daughter becomes sexually differentiated (as a girl or woman) only post-Oedipally.

In Lacanian terms, Freud excludes the mother/daughter relation from the symbolic order. Not only is the maternal connection lost or repressed but the ability to name or identify the loss as a loss is also barred. Banished from memory, the loss of the mother cannot be mourned. Irigaray claims that it is this genealogical asymmetry, with the father’s name memorialized and the mother’s body sacrificed to it, that sustains the legitimacy of patriarchy and propels the fantasy of a harmony of sexual difference, the conviction that the sexes are reciprocal and complementary in their identities and desires.

Sexual difference, in Irigaray’s reading of Freud, is thus subsumed under or derived from “the problematics of sameness” (Irigaray 1974 [1985a: 26]) that is not threatened by any real difference. Freud’s account of sexuality presupposes that the sexual subject is male, that there are no women, only mothers or those destined to become mothers, and that the meaning of being a woman is fully exhausted in the meaning of being a mother. In the psychical pre-history of the little girl as elaborated in the idea that “the little girl is a little man” (Freud 1933 [1968: 118]), she will not have been a daughter.

As little girls diverge from little boys, as they cease to be little men, they are expected to be appealing visual objects, the mirror of men’s desires, enabling men to represent themselves and shore up their self-image with an adoring reflection. Irigaray sees in this account a masculine desire for women’s desire to be directed toward men. Women are expected to provide the mirror that supports men’s projects, nurtures and nourishes their identities, and energizes their drive for mastery by presenting themselves as an alter ego. This imaginary, specular, order is matricidal, feeding on the blood of women, leaving unpaid its fundamental debt to the mother, and abandoning the subjectivity of the daughter.

Irigaray’s concern is that for Freud, the mother is only a mirror, and her relationship is always with a son; there are no mother/daughter relations. Not only is Western culture premised on matricide, which she claims is more primordial than the patricide of Totem and Taboo, but this matricide is forgotten and the mother remains unmourned. Repressing any maternal genealogy, political life has been predicated on the lineage between fathers and sons and the bonds of brotherhood, appropriating universality and citizenship to men and rendering women as objects of their desire and exchange. The exploitation of women is not merely a phenomenon that takes place within the social order; it is its very foundation and premise.

Irigaray calls the fraternal order “hom(m)osexuality,” meaning both that it is an order of the same (homo-) and that it is the order of men (homme): the regime of sexual indifference ignores relations among women, and especially between mothers and daughters, and situates women as the medium of men’s alliances with one another, as the buried support and energetic reserves of the body politic. This forgetting of the mother supports vertical and horizontal relations between men but leaves women unrepresented in language (as subjects) and incapable of achieving representation in the body politic (as citizens).

Thus Irigaray’s project aims to criticize the hom(m)osexual order and its specular economy, reinvigorate mother/daughter relations to make possible a feminine subjectivity, and cultivate sexual difference in the political realm. Developing the resources for transformation, i.e., for women to become citizens and subjects, entails disrupting the transmission of power between men and rethinking the passage from nature to culture represented by the Oedipal Complex. This task requires intervening in the symbolic and imaginary realms, creating a new language that would not be severed from the body.

For Irigaray, the association of subjectivity with masculinity precludes the convergence of being a woman and being a speaking being. Although there are words for women, these words constitute her only with reference to masculinity, as a photographic negative of man, or in response to a patriarchal exertion of feminine norms and expectations. They secure her in a masculine universe, they say in advance what she is, they render her captive to an idea of feminine essence. By contrast, Irigaray seeks to create a representation for women that would not be a designation of what she is, defining her by and holding her to some concrete essence, but would allow her to exist on her terms and speak for herself.

By acquiescing, in her mimetic writing style, to the cultural expectation of feminine artifice, Irigaray stages her exiled agency and thereby extends the possibilities for being a woman to include being not only an object in or reference of language but a transformer of language. Without claiming to say what a woman really is, to get right what the symbolic order gets wrong, she shows that in speaking differently, the very meaning of being a woman (or being a man) can be transformed, so that sexual difference remains open to new possibilities. She thus does not so much refute Freud’s account of the Oedipal Complex and the little girl’s purported masculinity as re-present its primal crime against women, the Oedipal exclusion of maternal dependency, thereby altering the scene of its representation.

Irigaray also challenges the Lacanian idea of the law of the father and the phallic signifier, pillorying the way in which natural birth has been assigned to maternity while cultural birth is assigned to paternity, equating the woman-mother with body and the man-father with language and law, and relegating the bodily process of parturition (maternity) to mute nature while valorizing the symbolic process of legitimation (paternity) as constitutive of civilization. Human subjectivity has been masculinized, while human flesh is both feminized and animalized. Irigaray aims to provoke a legitimation crisis in the paternal legacy and the name of the father that bestows on the child a political and familial identity.

Challenging the logic of the one, Irigaray takes the self-division of nature, its being-two, as a model of self-development. When Irigaray says that human nature is two, she means not that there are two fixed sexual substances, but that to be natural is to be embodied, finite, and divided, and that the fundamental character of human nature is growth through differentiation. If human nature is two, and always divided, Irigaray argues, then civil identity is also two and divided; the two of nature need to be brought into the two of culture. The one is an illusion of patriarchy, while the two threaten the phallocentric order and challenge the supposition that universality must be singular.

The idea of feminine subjectivity means that the universal must be doubled. Doubling the universal does not, for Irigaray, mean merely replacing a neutral universality with two wholly distinct and separate truths. A universal that has been doubled has also been split or divided from itself, no longer one. Irigaray sees in the doubled universal the possibility of overcoming a culture of sexual indifference and cultivating sexual difference. However, her affirmation of sexual difference does not mean affirming the feminine traits that have been ascribed to women, since these are the traits of sexual indifference, defined only with reference to men. Sexual difference has yet to appear, and it is her task to bring it into being.

Among many others, Jessica Benjamin (whose work will be discussed below) seems to share the view that Irigaray’s theoretical project is premised upon valorizing “female genitals as a starting point for a different desire” (Benjamin 1988: 276). No doubt this (mis)interpretation stems from Irigaray’s text “When Our Lips Speak Together” (Irigaray 1976 [1980]). But what Irigaray means by “speaking from the body” is moving away from a singular conception of origin and desire, and most especially the origin of desire. Her writing of women’s bodies, like her retrieval of mother/daughter genealogies, is a strategy of language and imagination, situating the body as a fluid border, the site of the overflow of culture into nature and vice versa, rather than a self-enclosed egoic center. She is not an essentialist who views women’s biology as their destiny. Instead, she challenges the nature/culture divide and the either/or of biology or civilization.

Similarly to Beauvoir, who ascertains that language and culture constitute the subject as masculine, and the feminine as other to him, Irigaray maintains that inhabiting a feminine subjectivity is paradoxical in a fraternal social order. But, for Irigaray, both Beauvoir and Freud fail to address sexual difference insofar as they retain a singular notion of masculine subjectivity: Freud because he presumes the libido is always masculine, and Beauvoir because she considers the aim of women’s emancipation to be equality with men (for instance by concluding The Second Sex with a call to brotherhood and seeming, arguably, to be calling for women to assimilate to masculine norms of selfhood).

Irigaray rejects the project of equality, since “equality” can only ever mean equality to men, and proposes instead doubling the notion of subjectivity in line with the subject’s own self-division. Women can have the rights of men only so long as they are like men, i.e., insofar as they are brothers, subsumed into the neutral individuality of the liberal social contract. This purportedly equal access to citizenship and subjectivity thus does not resolve the paradox, since it merely takes the side of subjectivity over that of femininity, retaining the constitution of the feminine as lack, the inverted image of man, the other of the same, that which stands in the way of political agency and obstructs autonomy, and which thus must be overcome in order to achieve self-determination. In the prevailing social contract, femininity and subjectivity remain opposed.

Irigaray does not think she can say what a woman is or what femininity is. Familial, social, and symbolic mechanisms of exchange have denied femininity its images and language, fashioning women through men’s language, images, and desires and thereby producing an apparent but false symmetry within a single, monotonous language. And although Irigaray often invokes the maternal as the source of life and subjectivity, she does not equate maternity with femininity or the mother with the woman. To find a language for feminine sexuality and feminine subjectivity, we must go “back through the dominant discourse” (Irigaray 1977 [1985b: 119]) with its metaphysical assumptions of substance or essence, and its concept of identity which adheres to the regime of sexual indifference.

Against the homogeny of the dominant discourse, with its same and its other, Irigaray construes the production or work of sexual difference as a relation between-two, to be the path toward liberating both femininity and masculinity from their metaphysical and political constraints by allowing them each to cultivate their own interdependent natures. The doubled, non-neutral, universal allows for distinctively feminine (and distinctively masculine) subjects to become citizen-subjects.

The idea of a between-two does not mean a singular path that is shared by both, but rather indicates, in addition to the value of a specifically feminine sexual identity and a specifically masculine sexual identity, the ethical path of an intersubjective relationality that allows them to appreciate and value one another. Since the between-two is premised on being-two (self-differentiated), it is in the cultivation of this sexual difference that we will find the possibility of an ethical sexual relation, what Irigaray calls an ethics of sexual difference.

4.2 Subjectivity, Alterity, and Alienation

While often grouped together in overviews of so-called French Feminism, Irigaray and Kristeva have fundamentally disparate projects (and locations in the academy), both with regard to their critical analyses and with regard to their political enterprises. Whereas Irigaray was a student of Lacan who breaks with (even as she is inspired by) his teachings from her earliest work, Kristeva has a much more ambiguous relationship to his school of thought and was never his student or attended his seminars. Their respective views can perhaps best be captured with respect to their attitude toward castration (the Oedipal Complex) and the social contract. As explained above, Irigaray envisions a sexuate culture that would overcome the Oedipal demands of a sacrificial economy and restore feminine genealogies to the work of civilization. Kristeva, by contrast, argues that there is no subjectivity beyond sacrifice and does not believe that Oedipal demands can or should be overcome.

However, both attend to the body and the drives, taking up the theme of loss or exile of the mother’s body and the impact of matricide on social relations. Kristeva even (echoing Irigaray) condemns humanism as “the fraternity of the same” (Kristeva 1998: 168) and, like Irigaray, she plays with writing style, offering experimental, innovative, sometimes imagistic portraits of psychical moods, maternal practices, and artistic endeavors.

Kristeva’s connection to feminist thought is also unsettled and volatile, although her focus on questions pertaining to language, femininity, and the maternal body has made her work amenable to feminist interest and development. In her essay “Women’s Time” (1979 [1986]), she classifies the feminist movement into three distinct times or generations, each with its own approach to justice. The first generation is universalist in principle and aspires to give women a place within history and the social contract; this generation takes equality as its mission and asserts women’s identification with the dominant values of rationality. Kristeva aligns Beauvoir with this project of pursuing access to universal subjectivity.

The second generation is reactive, rejecting the idea of assimilation to values taken to be masculine; this generation insists on feminine difference. While Kristeva does not mention Irigaray, it seems clear that Kristeva would align her with this strategy and the project of recognizing feminine specificity. In Kristeva’s view, the first generation is so committed to universal equality that it denies bodily difference, and the second generation is so committed to difference that it refuses to partake of a history it deems to be masculine. The third generation follows neither the path of fixing identity nor the path of neutralizing difference in the medium of universality. Instead, it embraces ambiguity and non-identity respecting the ineluctability of bodily difference.

Since Kristeva believes that there is no subjectivity and no sociality without the violence of the symbolic contract and the splitting of subjectivity, the feminism that she proposes would not take refuge from this violence either by standing outside history (as the second generation does), or by denying women’s bodies and desires (as the first generation does). Taking seriously the intransigence of sexual difference, and the fractures within identity, Kristeva advocates feminist support for alienation that would not pretend to reconcile the rupture between body and law (what Lacan calls castration) and would refuse the solace of identity (which underlines her affinity to third generation feminists.

For example, Kristeva mentions the bodily experience of pregnancy, an experience of being split, of being two in one, as manifesting the instability of, and alterity within, identity. Her insistence on the fragility and precariousness of identity can be grasped in the first instance by looking at Kristeva’s understanding of the drives and language. Kristeva introduces the notion of the semiotic as the affective dimension of language that facilitates its energetic movement. The semiotic is the materiality of language, its tonal and rhythmic qualities, and its bodily force. In Kristeva’s account, the drives are not simply excluded by language but also inscribed as an alien element within it. While more basic than signification, the semiotic participates in signifying practices.

Kristeva’s elaboration of the semiotic situates it at a point prior to the Lacanian imaginary, i.e., prior to the moment at which the infant identifies with its own mirror image ego or the image of an other. Still in porous relation to another body, without clear borders or limits, the infant is propelled by the anarchic, heterogeneous, rhythmic flow of drive energy “which has no thesis and no position” (Kristeva 1974 [1984: 26]). Mobile and provisional, moving through the body of the not-yet subject, the semiotic is a chaotic force anterior to language, unlocalizable because it courses through an as-yet undifferentiated materiality in which the infantile body is not yet distinct from the maternal body.

Kristeva calls this stage pre-thetic since it is prior to the reign of propositions, judgments, positions, and theses, these being subsequent possibilities that might arrest or seize a movement that always exceeds them. Since the image is itself a kind of sign, a first representation, the advent of the imaginary demarcates the first thetic break, a break from nature and into the realm of convention. What Kristeva means by the thetic then includes both the imaginary (the mirror stage) and the symbolic (the Oedipal Complex) dimensions of Lacan, thereby altering his understanding of the imaginary domain. Only with the advent of the thetic phase, the “threshold of language” (Kristeva 1974 [1984: 45]), can there be said to be signification proper along with negation as judgment.

Kristeva attends to the pre-Oedipal mother/child relation in a way that is underdeveloped in Freud’s and Lacan’s works. Nonetheless, Kristeva accepts Freud’s insight that the thetic break or the prohibitory break of the Oedipal Complex that founds law and sociality is violent and murderous (Kristeva 1974 [1984: 70]). However, as she puts it, “the structural violence of language’s irruption as the murder of soma, the transformation of the body, the captation of drives” (Kristeva 1974 [1984: 75]), is preceded by a loving father who makes possible the preliminary individuation of the infant from the mother.

Although symbolic violence is integral to the maintenance of a social order, the promise of language on Kristeva’s account is initially brought forward by love, not by law. In Tales of Love (1983 [1987]),which jumps off from Freud’s claim in The Ego and the Id that identification with the father of individual pre-history is prior to and more primary than object-cathexis, Kristeva offers an original account of the pre-Oedipal period, finding a paternal figure there. The imaginary father makes possible the initial separation between ego and object, or rather proto-ego and proto-object. This father is not the first object, but the first identification, making language and love possible, movement within and among a world of others.

This identification, Kristeva hypothesizes, alters maternal space, and interrupts it with something beyond its borders. But it also indicates that there is a preliminary pre-thetic symbolic capacity at work in infantile life. As the drives expel, detach, or isolate a proto-object, the space of differentiation is supported by identification with the imaginary father, who holds it open. The imaginary father is here associated with love (unlike the symbolic father who is associated with law), an invitation to language and subjectivity, to become a being who can have relations with others.

The breaking in of the signifier inaugurates individuation, the assumption of bodily form and corporeal unity, and thereby entails loss of the maternal body. Unlike Irigaray, who wants to retrieve the pre-Oedipal period in order to reclaim feminine genealogies, Kristeva wants only to redescribe it in order to reassess its import for individuation and creative self-transformation. She takes infantile matricide (separation from the mother) to be a necessary condition of subjectivity and not a remnant of patriarchal violence.

Signification and language are sites of sublimation, creative workings-out of the drives, but they can be stalled by abjection and melancholia which are both preconditions for, but also limits to, subjectification. Kristeva identifies abjection and melancholia as sites of psychical (and social) crisis rooted in narcissistic disorder. In them, the tenuous processes of ego-formation risk collapse; faced with difficulty clarifying the boundaries of the self, the subject reverts to ambivalent aggressivity. While Kristeva understands narcissism to be a fundamental, if unstable, structure of the psyche, abjection and melancholia are problematic relations to the maternal body and its loss (or the malfunctioning of its loss). They are experiences of disintegration or dissolution of the ego without reorganization, but also of its rabid fortification.

In Powers of Horror: An Essay on Abjection (1980 [1982]), the abject is described as neither inside nor outside, neither subject nor object, neither self nor other, troubling identity and order with the instability of boundaries, borders, and limits. Kristeva offers examples of bodily fluids, sweat, blood, pus, and milk as non-objects that are banished in the course of ego formation. These non-objects also include the mother’s body; indeed the maternal body is a privileged site of abjection, as it is that which must be excluded in order for individuation and separation to take place so that one can distinguish self from other and establish a dyadic (imaginary) relation out of undifferentiated maternal space or the semiotic chora, the pre-spatial relation of fluid (although not entirely unregulated) drives. The chora refers to the first six months or earliest, pre-linguistic period of an infant’s existence when the child’s perceptions are determined by her or his drives, a mixture of feelings and needs, and when the child cannot distinguish between her-/himself and the mother as separate entities. The abject can then also be called the primally repressed, primal because prior not only to the secondary symbolic prohibition of the incest taboo or Oedipal Complex but also prior to the establishment of any identity.

The abject is horrifying, repellent, but also fascinating; it is strange but familiar. The process of abjection is not merely a symptom of phobia or borderline disorder, but a necessary and even recurring ordeal in any subject’s transition to identification with the father and accession to language. It is the most archaic form of negativity, an exclusion or expulsion which functions by securing the borders of self, carving a space, and marking a divide, out of which the ego can emerge. Kristeva calls it the violent attempt “to release the hold of maternal entity” (Kristeva 1980 [1982: 13]) or rather what will have been the mother since this process establishes the distinction between the maternal body and the infant in the first place. The abject exposes the precariousness of the subject/object divide, the fragility of identity, and the need to constitute oneself against the threat of, and desire for, dissolution.

Although this is not primarily Kristeva’s concern, abjection can also be understood as a social phenomenon, one with political implications, which the US American feminist political philosopher Iris Marion Young, in her Justice and the Politics of Difference (1990) outlines. Young draws on Kristeva’s notion of the abject to explain how the primal repression of the mother in which the infant struggles to break away and separate from the mother’s body to acquire a sense of self generates a fragile border between the I (the self) and the other, with the self being in constant danger to fall back into the unity. Although the self feels the loss of the mother, it rejects re-enclosure, which could lead to the disintegration of the self. Young points out that racism, sexism, homophobia, ageism, and ableism are partly structured by abjection and imply involuntary, unconscious judgments of ugliness and loathing of the abjected other.

The abject provokes fear because it exposes the fragile border between the self and the Other. For example, since borders between gay and straight are permeable, and everybody can become gay, especially me, I need to defend my fragile heterosexual identity by turning away from gays with irrational disgust. Another example Young provides is older adults, who bring up the fear of death in me, the dissolving of borders, which is why I unconsciously judge them as ugly and turn away from them. Disabled people confront me with the fact that it is only my good luck that I am not disabled myself, which is why I loathe disabled people. Therefore, unconscious reactions on a bodily level, which we often do not recognize because society privileges rationality over the body, reinforce the oppression of vulnerable groups (Young 1990: 144).

The confusion of borders, the ambivalent relation to maternal space, also motivates melancholia. The idea of the maternal as the primally repressed recurs in Black Sun: Depression and Melancholia, where Kristeva claims, “matricide is our vital necessity” (Kristeva 1987 [1989: 27]), the founding partition that facilitates the birth and growth of the ego. Kristeva praises the child, the “intrepid wanderer” who “leaves the crib to meet the mother in the realm of representations” (1987 [1989: 41]). Maintaining that the organization of the psyche is premised on loss, Kristeva also understands that the suffering entailed by loss can derail the formation of a self, and that loss itself can become the dominant reality for some who are unable to establish a secure relation to themselves.

While mourning, for Kristeva as for Freud, enables a subject to, gradually and painfully, let go of loss by establishing a relation in language to it, melancholia enables the subject to hold onto lost objects, most especially the mother or, better, the dead (or repressed) mother. The loving father facilitates mourning and linguistic creativity; the deadening mother disables self-creation. In Kristeva’s understanding of melancholic breakdown, the problem is similar to the one discussed above in the section on Irigaray, namely that loss goes unnamed and unmourned but thereby stays unprocessed within, leaving the subject stagnant and inert.

Women, in Kristeva’s view, suffer the loss of creativity, the incapacity for sublimation, more severely than men. Women’s access to language and creative self-transformation is more vulnerable to disturbance both because of the (previously discussed) inexorable repression of their pre-Oedipal relation to the mother and because they have greater difficulty establishing a primary identification with the father. Whereas the loss of the archaic bond with the maternal body is (potentially) sublated by men into the rhythms of language, for women it often becomes a dead space where once there was life, filled only with loss and emptiness. Imprisoned by an undead, unmourned, mother, excluded from language or representation, women are vulnerable to the devastations of symbolic sacrifice without recompense.

Psychoanalysis is presented as a counter-depressant, as are art and writing, able not only to keep the drives or semiotic forces moving through language but also to foster their revolutionary potential to transgress symbolic limits and laws and to creatively rework self and society. Accessing the drives and rhythms that symbolic law and order typically repress, psychoanalytic practice, like the poetic text, revitalizes or reactivates the semiotic chora, a connection to the maternal body or to femininity. Such practices let loose the disorganizing energies of the body, the pleasurable rupture of sense and nonsense. They take productive advantage of the dialectical discord between semiotic and symbolic and thus keep this discord oriented toward dissent and protest rather than inner collapse.

Although the semiotic resists the symbolic order or cannot be contained by it, the two are always entangled and imbricated in language; drives both support and subvert the symbolic operation, bringing bodily rhythms and forces to signification, both impelling and pulling apart its organization and stasis. This disruptive potential of semiotic drives and rhythms is associated with negativity as a force of revolt, an excess, most archaically, the force of bodily expulsion, but more generally the forces that continually spur the dissolution of one’s own organization. Negativity maintains life, and keeps it going by circulating energy, rendering the subject always in process. Through its movement, the subject is not a rigid identity but always developing, reconfiguring itself through the interplay of drives and language, in the tensions between body and mirror image and between mirror image and self.

5. Anglo-American Psychoanalytic Feminism

There are a number of Anglo-American (and Australian) feminist theorists and scholars who read Lacan and laid the groundwork for the passage from French to English and from France to the US, Britain, and Australia in the 1970s, 1980s, and early 1990s. Among these are Juliet Mitchell (Psychoanalysis and Feminism, 1974), Teresa Brennan (The Interpretation of the Flesh: Freud and Femininity, 1992), Elizabeth Grosz (Jacques Lacan: A Feminist Introduction, 1990), Jane Gallop (Reading Lacan, 1985, and The Daughter’s Seduction, 1982), Jacqueline Rose (Sexuality in the Field of Vision, 1986), Drucilla Cornell (Transformations: Recollective Imagination and Sexual Difference, 1993). While writing in English, these theorists take their bearings from the French Lacanian approach to psychoanalysis and can generally be classified in the field of what today gets called “Continental Feminism.” Responsible for revitalizing psychoanalysis for feminist thought and countering earlier feminist dismissals, they aim to reclaim Freud’s central analyses for feminist purposes. Juliet Mitchell, for instance, develops the insight indispensable to any feminist reading, that “psychoanalysis is not a recommendation for a patriarchal society, but an analysis of one” (Mitchell 1974: xiii). Mitchell and Rose are also the co-editors of Feminine Sexuality (1982), a selection from Lacan’s seminars, for which both editors wrote influential introductions.

Other psychoanalytic feminists have made use of Lacan’s association of the phallus with the real to explain that we can never fully determine the meaning of sexual difference, which challenges any attempts to essentialize masculinity and femininity. For example, Suzanne Barnard explains that the Lacanian phallus “does not signify essential sexual difference but…stands ultimately for the impossibility of signifying sex. As such, it can be understood to represent both a traumatic failure of meaning and the impossibility of ever fundamentally anchoring or positivizing the symbolic order” (Barnard and Fink 2002: 10). Some feminist thinkers suggest that the phallus’s link with the real, which tells us that we can never reach reality, generates anxieties in men from whom we demand to have the phallus.

Feminist Lacanians have also pointed at the importance of the Lacanian real for rethinking sexual difference beyond gendered dichotomies and beyond essentializing gender categories. For example, the US American psychoanalytic feminist Drucilla Cornell sees an inherent potential in the real for feminist thought because we can never fully determine what it means to be a “woman” or a “man,” and which opens up a space to rethink these categories. For Cornell, the real is central for feminist theorizing because it indicates that the truth of what we are as subjects is never fully captured by gender categories and it directs us to a potential that we can find “in this excess of what we can be thought to be within any gender system” (Cornell 1996: 159).

Feminist thinkers also draw on Lacan’s work to rethink the two tensions inherent in the idea of the “female political subject” and to further theorize power. The first is the tension between the idea of a free and autonomous subject (defended by mainstream liberal theories) and the idea of the subject as emerging in the moment of subjection to power-discourses (defended by Foucaultian-inspired feminist theorizing). Here, the question for feminist theory remains: can we theorize the female subject as emerging in the moment of subjection to power discourses and envision her as a female political subject who can contest and transform power structures? The second tension is between the thoughts that, on the one hand, that the female political subject conceptualized as a collectivity, a “we”, is inherently exclusionary, and on the other hand, defining a political subject and invoking the concept of “woman” remains necessary to theorize an agent of sociopolitical transformation. Here, the question that remains is: can we theorize the feminist political subject, a “we” necessary for an agency, without such “we” becoming exclusionary?

The Austrian American psychoanalytic feminist thinker Claudia Leeb, in her Power and Feminist Agency in Capitalism (2017), draws on Lacan’s concept of the real (and Theodor W. Adorno’s concept of non-identity) to engage with these tensions and find answers to these questions. In response to the first tension, she shows us that although the signifier (S, woman) brings the signified (s, the female subject) into being, the signifier fails to entirely subordinate her because there is a bar (/) between the signifier and the signified (the Lacanian real), that resists absolute signification (S/s). In this moment of the real, which she calls the moment limit, the hole in the w/hole, the space opens up for women to step forward as political subjects who are in a position to challenge and transform oppressive power structures. In response to the second tension, she draws on Lacan to formulate her idea of the female political subject-in-outline. Such a female subject moves within the tension of a certain coherence (the subject) to effect change and permanent openness (the outline) to counter the exclusionary character of a female collectivity. Because the feminist political subject-in-outline embraces its non-wholeness, excluded subjects can enter (or exit) the political collectivity and redefine its boundaries.

The Anglo-American development of feminist psychoanalysis has also descended from and is indebted to British object relations theory and its focus on the pre-Oedipal mother-child bond, especially the work of Melanie Klein (1975a, 1975b) and Donald Winnicott (1971). Authors who work in this vein include Nancy Chodorow (The Reproduction of Mothering, 1978), Dorothy Dinnerstein (The Mermaid and the Minotaur, 1976), and Jessica Benjamin (Bonds of Love, 1988, and Like Subjects, Love Objects, 1995). What distinguishes this Anglo-American tradition from the French-influenced one is its emphasis on pre-Oedipal sociality or intersubjectivity and its focus on the values of integration, harmony, and wholeness, as opposed to those of self-division and respecting the alien within.

The remainder of this section will focus on the work of Benjamin as exemplary of the Anglo-American approach, and clarify its differences from and similarities with the French approach. Like Irigaray, Benjamin is perturbed by the psychoanalytic depiction of social life as the world of men, developed on the basis of the father-son relation and its aggression, hostility, love, and mourning. Deploring this “struggle for power” (Benjamin 1988: 6) in which women are merely the triangulating object of desire, Benjamin argues that, in the formation of identity, subjects become bound by love to oppressive social relations. She worries that “domination is anchored in the hearts of the dominated” (1988: 5), that women are erotically attached to patriarchal power, and she believes that psychoanalysis can help explain how and why this is so. Psychoanalysis thus offers to Benjamin insights not only into the individual psyche but also into the organization, structure, and distribution of political power and hierarchy. Her aim is “to grasp the deep structure of gender as a binary opposition which is common to psychic and cultural representations” (1988: 218).

Unlike Kristeva and Irigaray, both of whom problematize the duality and comprehensiveness of the nature/culture distinction, and emphasize transformation of symbolic bonds, Benjamin highlights the role of (contradictory) cultural stereotypes in bringing forth gender as we know and live it, and emphasizes the need for social transformation.Taking what she calls an eclectic approach, and eschewing methodological orthodoxy with regard to Freudian metapsychology and the theory of the instincts, Benjamin establishes her project on the basis of a two-person relational perspective, with the other as a separate independent subject. Rather than an undifferentiated unity governing early infantile life in the pre-Oedipal period, which would make of the infant merely a “monadic energy system” (Benjamin 1988: 17), she maintains that a genuine duality and relationality exist from the start and that the process of growth entails development within relationships rather than a development of them. The infant, she postulates, is a fundamentally active and social creature, reaching out to the world and expressing a desire for recognition. The knots of identity are formed via the interplay of this desire with the response of another who variously affirms or defies the child. Benjamin claims that this emphasis on sociality and intersubjectivity is not intended to disregard the intrapsychic elements of subject formation, and in fact she argues for “the interaction between the psyche and social life” (1988: 5). She holds that the inner and the outer are not competitive but complementary theoretical perspectives. Nonetheless, she does want to situate identity generally, and gendered identity more specifically, within the purview of the subject’s multiple and ambiguous social identifications.

Domination, she argues, ensues from the failures of recognition built into the political and social order, not merely failures that take place at the personal or individual level in a single relationship. Borrowing an initial insight from Foucault, Benjamin looks at the way power shapes and forms identities and desires, producing gendered relations (Benjamin 1988: 4). Borrowing another insight from Hegel, Benjamin depicts the dialectic of recognition in the struggle for identity as a “conflict between independence and dependence” (1988: 33). In her view, however, the Hegelian tale, like the Freudian one, erroneously begins with a “monadic, self-interested ego” (1988: 33) and it thus concludes with the inevitability of breakdown and domination. According to Benjamin, Winnicott resolves the Hegelian and Freudian dilemma (Benjamin 1988: 38), the solitary egoism of the fight to the death, by reformulating the problem of recognition at the level of fantasy and distinguishing between internal and external worlds. The infant feels confident in asserting its independence, and destroying its object in fantasy, so long as that object is discovered to have a secure external existence in reality. In other words, the fantasy of destruction is appeased by its failure; the infant destroys internally but externally is relieved to still have an object to address and interact with. More particularly, the infant destroys or separates from the mother internally and in fantasy, but simultaneously retains a relation to her externally and in reality. The good enough mother must foster this relationship between two separate egos, neither allowing the child to succeed in destroying or dominating her, nor allowing herself to squash the child’s nascent attempts at self-assertion. The mother-child relation is then a kind of revised neo-Hegelian struggle for power, retaining the aim of mutual recognition or respect, but risking domination and rebellion. The violent conflicts within are not repressed but neutralized and pacified in the reality of intersubjective life that affirms and recognizes autonomy.

Asking, as do Chodorow and Dinnerstein, about the genesis of patriarchal power, Benjamin concludes, as they also do, that a main source or component lies in exclusive childrearing by women/mothers, which occasions the related risks of collapsing maternal authority into mere dominance, supporting the fantasy of maternal omnipotence, centering potent ambivalence on the mother, and fostering rigid gender identities and identifications. While the boy attains autonomy via loving identification with the father and separation from the mother, the girl’s relation to paternal power is complicated by its inaccessibility to her. If she seeks “liberation in the father” (Benjamin 1988: 99), she connects her femininity to submission rather than agency, and attaches to masculinity as an idealized object of love (and as its love-object), conferring on it value while devaluing the mother, and creating a divide between feminine sexuality and autonomous subjectivity. Benjamin argues, however, that the “protean impersonality” (Benjamin 1988: 216) of male domination cannot be addressed by a critique that focuses solely on the family and childcare, and that power relations cannot be overcome solely through a transformation in caretaking roles, although the equation of women with motherhood is certainly one component of the problem. If gendered identities are encouraged by social power relations—masculinity is developed as a denial of dependency and assertion of independence, while femininity is developed in an identification with nurturing and concession of autonomy—then real transformation requires attention to social roles and “cultural representations” (Benjamin 1988: 217), since “the core feature of the gender system—promoting masculinity as separation from and femininity as continuity with the primary bond—is maintained even when mother and father participate equally in that bond” (Benjamin 1988: 217). In Benjamin’s theoretical model, children are responsive not only to their social environment, but also to ideas with opaque meanings (mandates, expectations, prohibitions, exhortations, etc.) that are often covertly, indirectly, or unknowingly conveyed in parental language and edicts. Gender equality thus requires that women be recognized, by themselves and by men, as subjects in culture and that intersubjectivity itself be revalued.

Benjamin’s analysis can be distinguished from those of Irigaray and Kristeva precisely by the way in which it tends to conflate or collapse the distinction between representation and social roles. While Anglo-American psychoanalytic feminism theorizes gender as derived from or dependent on social (including familial) inequalities and power relations, and thus aims to reduce its psychic effects by redressing social and familial domination/subordination, French feminism does not calibrate the psyche on socio-cultural relations but on imaginary and symbolic representations. Benjamin’s partitioning of intrapsychic life into internal and external relations, and her vision of intersubjective equilibrium is, in contrast to Irigaray and Kristeva’s assertion of discord within and between subjects, oriented by the conviction that social harmony is desirable and attainable.

6. Conclusion

Psychoanalysis presents a critical and diagnostic project, not necessarily a normative or liberatory one. In developing a theory of the drives and the non-rational forces that move and impel us, the idea that we are opaque rather than transparent to ourselves, incapable of complete self-knowledge or self-mastery, psychoanalytic theory also challenges the rationalist, humanist ego and proposes that our ethical characters and political communities are not perfectable, exposing the precariousness of both psychic and political identity. The unconscious cannot be assumed to be inherently either a transgressive or a conservative force, but an unreliable one, promoting revolt or rebellion sometimes, intransigence and rigid border preservation at other times.

Although they are in often uneasy alliance, the psychoanalytic account of the unconscious provides feminist theory with resources for both political and ontological inquiry. Ontologically, psychoanalysis offers a distinctively psychical understanding of sexual difference, how we come to inhabit our bodies and our identities, and misinhabit them, an analysis reducible to neither social nor biological categories. Politically, psychoanalysis offers a depiction of the forces that impel us to organize, disorganize, and reorganize the bonds that hold us together. By offering insight into the formation of subjectivity and the animating fantasies of social life, psychoanalysis thus also facilitates feminist analysis of the obdurate elements of patriarchal social relations, including the symbolic bonds and internal forces that undergird identity and attach sexed subjects to relations of dominance and subordination. Psychoanalytic feminist attention to the core constituents of civilization, to the nuclei of sexual difference and communal affiliation, helps explain the perpetuation of masculine power and enables feminist theorists to articulate possible correctives, challenges, routes of amelioration, or ethical interruptions that go to the roots of political life and to its beyond and do not simply operate on the given social terrain.

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Further Reading

  • Beardsworth, Sara, 2004, Julia Kristeva: Psychoanalysis and Modernity, Albany, NY: SUNY Press.
  • Beauvoir, Simone de, 1947 [1949], Pour une morale de l’ambiguïté (Collection Idées), Paris: Gallimard; translated by Bernard Frechtman as The Ethics of Ambiguity, New York: Philosophical Library, 1949.
  • Bell, Vikki, 2010, “New Scenes of Vulnerability, Agency and Plurality: An Interview with Judith Butler”, Theory, Culture & Society, 27(1): 130–152. doi:10.1177/0263276409350371
  • Benjamin, Jessica, 1998, Shadow of the Other: Intersubjectivity and Gender in Psychoanalysis, New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203948149
  • –––, 2017, Beyond Doer and Done To: Recognition Theory, Intersubjectivity and the Third, Abingdon/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781315437699
  • Brennan, Teresa, 1993, History after Lacan, London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203005095
  • Butler, Judith, 1993, Bodies That Matter: On the Discursive Limits of “Sex”, New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203828274
  • –––, 1997, The Psychic Life of Power: Theories in Subjection, Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
  • –––, 1999, Gender Trouble: Feminism and the Subversion of Identity, New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203824979
  • –––, 2004a, Precarious Life: The Powers of Mourning and Violence, London/New York: Verso.
  • –––, 2004b, Undoing Gender, New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203499627
  • Butler, Judith, Ernesto Laciau, and Slavoj Žižek, 2000, Contingency, Hegemony, Universality: Contemporary Dialogues on the Left (Phronesis), London: Verso.
  • Caputi, Mary, 2020, “‘The Known Footsteps of My Mother’: The Power of the Abyss in Elena Ferrante’s Neapolitan Novels”, Theory & Event, 23(3): 641–663.
  • Chanter, Tina, and Ewa Płonowska Ziarek (eds.), 2005, Revolt, Affect, Collectivity: The Unstable Boundaries of Kristeva’s Polis (SUNY Series in Gender Theory), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.Cimitile, Maria, and Elaine P. Miller (eds.), 2007, Returning to Irigaray: Feminist Philosophy, Politics, and the Question of Unity (SUNY Series in Gender Theory), Albany, NY: State University of New York Press.
  • Cixous, Hélène, and Catherine Clément, 1975 [1986], La Jeune née, Paris: Union générale d’éditions; translated by Betsy Wing as The Newly Born Woman (Theory and History of Literature 24), Minneapolis, MN: University of Minnesota Press, 1986.
  • Copjec, Joan, 1994, Read My Desire: Lacan against the Historicists, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • –––, 2002, Imagine There’s No Woman: Ethics and Sublimation, Cambridge, MA: MIT Press.
  • de Lauretis, Teresa, 1994, The Practice of Love: Lesbian Sexuality and Perverse Desire, Bloomington, IN: Indiana University Press.
  • Deutscher, Penelope, 2002, A Politics of Impossible Difference: The Later Work of Luce Irigaray, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press.
  • Freud, Anna, 1936 [1966], Das Ich und die Abwehrmechanismen, Wien: Internationaler Psychoanalytischer Verlag; translated by Cecil Baines as The Ego and the Mechanisms of Defence, London: Hogarth Press; revised edition, New York: International Universities Press, 1966.
  • Gammelgaard, Judy, 2017, “Why Dora Left: Freud and the Master Discourse”, Studies in Gender and Sexuality, 18(3): 201–211. doi:10.1080/15240657.2017.1349513
  • Kofman, Sarah, 1980 [1985], L’Enigme de la femme: la femme dans les textes de Freud, Paris: Galilée; translated by Catherine Porter as The Enigma of Woman: Woman in Freud’s Writings, Ithaca, NY: Cornell University Press, 1985.
  • Laplanche, Jean, and Jean-Bertrand Pontalis, 1967 [1973], Vocabulaire de la psychanalyse (Bibliothèque de psychanalyse), Paris: Presses universitaires de France; translated by Donald Nicholson-Smith as The Language of Psycho-Analysis, London: Hogarth Press, 1973.
  • Leeb, Claudia, 2020, “The Hysteric Rebels: Rethinking Radical Socio-Political Transformation with Foucault and Lacan”, Theory & Event, 23(3): 607–640.McAfee, Noëlle, 2021, Feminism: A Quick Immersion, New York: Tibidabo Publishing.
  • Oliver, Kelly, 2004, The Colonization of Psychic Space: A Psychoanalytic Social Theory of Oppression, Minneapolis, MN: University of Minnesota Press.
  • Rabate, Jean-Michel (ed.), 2003, The Cambridge Companion to Lacan, Cambridge: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CCOL0521807441
  • Rothenberg, Molly Anne, 2010, The Excessive Subject: A New Theory of Social Change, Cambridge: Polity.
  • Ruti, Mari, 2018, Penis Envy and Other Bad Feelings: The Emotional Costs of Everyday Life, New York: Columbia University Press.
  • Salecl, Renata, 2004, On Anxiety (Thinking in Action), London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203508282
  • –––, 2020, A Passion for Ignorance: What We Choose Not to Know and Why, Princeton, NJ: Princeton University Press.
  • Shepherdson, Charles, 2000, Vital Signs: Nature, Culture, Psychoanalysis, New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9780203902059
  • Sjöholm, Cecilia, 2005, Kristeva and the Political (Thinking the Political), London/New York: Routledge.
  • Soler, Colette, 2003 [2006], Ce que Lacan disait des femmes: étude de psychanalyse, Paris: Champ lacanien; translated by John Holland as What Lacan Said about Women: A Psychoanalytic Study, New York: Other Press, 2006.
  • Stone, Alison, 2006, Luce Irigaray and the Philosophy of Sexual Difference, Cambridge/New York: Cambridge University Press. doi:10.1017/CBO9780511617287
  • Whitford, Margaret, 1991, Luce Irigaray: Philosophy in the Feminine, London/New York: Routledge. doi:10.4324/9781315824741
  • Zakin, Emily, 2000, “Bridging the Social and the Symbolic: Toward a Feminist Politics of Sexual Difference”, Hypatia, 15(3): 19–44. doi:10.1111/j.1527-2001.2000.tb00329.x
  • Ziarek, Ewa Płonowska, 2001, An Ethics of Dissensus: Postmodernity, Feminism, and the Politics of Radical Democracy, Stanford, CA: Stanford University Press.
  • Žižek, Slavoj, 1994, The Metastases of Enjoyment: Six Essays on Woman and Causality, London/New York: Verso.
  • –––, 2002, “The Real of Sexual Difference”, in Barnard and Fink 2002: 57–75.

Other Internet Resources

  • French Feminist Theory, at the Women’s Studies Resources website, maintained by Karla Tonella, University of Iowa.
  • philoSOPHIA: A Feminist Society.
  • Luce Irigaray, entry in the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy, by Sarah K. Donovan (Villanova).
  • Literary Theory, entry in the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy, by Vince Brewton (U. North Alabama).
  • Jacques Lacan, entry in the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy, by Matthew Sharpe (U. Melbourne).
  • Sigmund Freud, entry in the Internet Encyclopedia of Philosophy, by Stephen Thornton (U. Limerick).

Copyright © 2025 by
Claudia Leeb <claudia.leeb@wsu.edu>
Emily Zakin

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