Domination

Theories of domination try to understand the value of justice, freedom, and equality by examining their absence. Such theories seek to clarify and systematize our judgments about what it is to be vulnerable, degraded, or defenseless over against unrestrained power.

• 1. Domination: The Basic Idea
• 2. Who, or What, Can Dominate?
  • 2.1 Domination by Agents, Group Agents, and Groups
  • 2.2 Domination by Structures, Systems, and Norms
• 3. Does Domination Require the Exercise of Power?
  • 3.1 Domination as a Power Structure
  • 3.2 Does Character Matter after All?
  • 3.3 Over-Generalization Problems for Structure-Based Accounts
  • 3.4 Structure as Status
• 4. What Kind of Power Is Domination?
  • 4.1 Non-Moralized, Norm-Independent Theories
  • 4.2 Moralized, Norm-Independent Theories
  • 4.3 Non-Moralized, Norm-Dependent Theories
  • 4.4 Moralized, Norm-Dependent Theories
• 5. Applications
• 6. Conclusion
• Bibliography
• Academic Tools
• Other Internet Resources
• Related Entries

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Domination is a kind of power, and specifically social power—that is, power manifest in the sphere of interpersonal relations.

Domination typically involves imbalances or asymmetries in power. The English domination comes from the Latin dominus. A dominus is a “master” and mastery represents an extreme of social power. So-called masters usually have all but complete control over how the enslaved will act or over the conditions in which they act. As a result, the slaver/enslaved relation is often treated as the most obvious case of domination. (In what follows I will avoid the language of “masters” and “slaves” given that it originally reflected the perspective of the former.)

Domination has many forms. Traditional Roman republicans recognized a distinction between imperium and dominium—domination by the state contrasted with domination by private parties (Pettit 1997; 31; 2001: 152ff). Being enslaved may be the clearest case of domination, but literal enslavement is not necessary. Tyrants over their subjects and men over women in patriarchal societies are also standard examples of domination. Combined with slavery, these examples are so common in the literature we can refer to them simply as the Paradigms. Failing to explain why the Paradigms exemplify domination is sometimes considered reason enough to reject a theory of domination (see Lovett 2010, Blunt 2015, and McCammon 2015). Other examples may not manifest the extremes of power we see in the Paradigms, but it is generally recognized that domination comes in degrees, and someone may be dominated even if nobody has total power over them.

Dominating power is in some sense unconstrained. It is often described as arbitrary or discretionary; or, perhaps, unlimited by the interests of those under its sway; or, perhaps, projecting a worldview most favorable to the empowered while preventing the subjugated from seeing themselves or the world on their own terms. However characterized, the claim that domination involves the absence of control or limitation recurs in many theories.

Domination is an unjust or morally illegitimate form of social power. Whatever domination turns out to be, it is morally serious. It is a complaint (Pettit 2005). To be dominated is typically to have cause for indignation and resentment against the dominator or against institutions that dominate or make domination possible. (As we will see, agreement that domination is morally wrong is not the same as agreement about whether the best conception of domination is moralized. See section 4 below.) It is more common for theorists of domination to assume than to explain its injustice. This is probably because the Paradigms are also prime exemplars of unjust social relations.

Contemporary disagreement about domination often involves competing answers to three questions: (1) Who, or what, can dominate? (2) Does domination involve the mere existence of power with a certain structure or is domination an exercise of power? (3) Exercised or unexercised, what kind of power is domination? The remainder of this entry will address each of these questions and conclude with a survey of how the idea of domination features in recent applied ethical and political theory. It will become clear as we examine various answers to these three questions that there are very different ideas of why, exactly, we need a theory of domination. There may be wide agreement that we need a theory of domination to make sense of unjust power relations, but unjust power relations are wildly varied, and theorists of domination disagree not only about which varieties most need to be understood, but about how theorizing domination helps us to understand them.

A word of qualification: this entry is predominantly a survey of work from anglophone political philosophers and theorists, broadly within the analytic tradition. Recent literature on domination in this tradition was largely spawned by the “republican revival”—a renewal of interest in the republican tradition associated with Quentin Skinner’s historical scholarship and Philip Pettit’s political theory. This tradition treats domination as the primary political evil, mostly by opposing it to freedom as the primary political good. (For more, see the entry republicanism.) Hereafter, I will refer to this movement as neorepublicanism. Neorepublicanism emerged as a corrective to what Skinner and Pettit saw as inadequacies in common liberal theories of freedom: centrally, the theory of liberty as the absence of interference made famous by Isaiah Berlin’s “Two Concepts of Liberty” (1969). (See the entries on Isaiah Berlin and positive and negative liberty.) In quick summation, neorepublicans object that freedom is compromised by the presence of someone who can interfere with our choices, even if they choose not to do so, in the way that a slaver can interfere with the lives of the enslaved even if he chooses to leave them alone. This is, roughly, the neorepublican conception of domination: having discretionary power to interfere with the choices of others should you choose to do so, even if you do not so choose.

Given their initial foils, neorepublicans began theorizing domination at considerable distance from continental theories and accepted many of the assumptions and priorities of 20th Century liberalism. Increasingly, however, the separation of analytic and continental traditions is narrower in theories of domination than in other areas of contemporary philosophy. It is not uncommon for recent writers to avail themselves of conceptual resources from both traditions. Even so, for better or for worse, considerations of continental thought here are mostly limited to their encounters with the analytic literature. (For a more comprehensive treatment of continental theories of power and domination, see feminist perspectives on power.)

2. Who, or What, Can Dominate?

2.1 Domination by Agents, Group Agents, and Groups

Neorepublicans tend to present domination as a relation between agents: only agents can dominate or be dominated. You cannot dominate or be dominated unless you have a general ability to act intentionally based on your beliefs and desires (see Lovett 2022, 31). But individual agents often dominate because of their membership in some larger group: e.g., white people in Western racialized hierarchies, men in patriarchy. This is instructive. An individual man who rejects patriarchy may still have unjust power over women because of what he is in a position to do, even if he explicitly rejects and tries to undermine patriarchal institutions. So, group membership is a way someone might dominate without wanting to, given that we are not always able to choose the social groups we belong to. (For a minority position that domination is fundamentally a relation between groups, where any domination between individuals is parasitic on group membership, see Wartenberg 1990.)

The question of domination by groups has produced significant recent controversy. Neorepublicans emphasize what we just noted about well-intentioned individual men within patriarchy: domination is manifest in what agents are able to do, not only in what they do. Neorepublicans insist that the malignant power of “benevolent” or lazy slavers is housed in their capacity, not their willingness, to interfere. Likewise, avoiding interference in the actual world because others decide not to bother us is no evidence that we avoid domination. We must also be protected from interference in possible worlds where others decide they would like very much to bother us. This is sometimes called the robustness requirement for theories of domination. It is, perhaps, the central insight of neorepublicanism.

Neorepublicans also claim that we may be dominated by groups of individuals who could not, on their own, dominate us. This presents a problem. Isn’t it always possible for other people to gang up into dominating groups? Does this mean we are always dominated? Keith Dowding calls this the coalition problem: “For any individual i at any given time, there is always a coalition of others {j, k, l,} who could stop i from doing x” (2011, 310). If this possibility is domination, domination is inevitable. But if domination is inevitable—a permanent part of social life for creatures like us—it will not make sense to treat it as an injustice.

As we will see, this kind of problem recurs. We need to theorize domination so that it doesn’t turn out to be an unavoidable part of social life, and so not worth complaining about. This is now often called the problem of “cheap domination” (McCammon 2015, 1033, Lazar 2023, and Gädeke 2024).

Pettit and List (2011) tried to avoid the coalition problem by clarifying what it takes to dominate as a group. Dominating groups have group agency (Pettit and List 2011, 19–21). Take a typical professor in a typical classroom. It is possible for students to stop the professor from teaching, should they all choose to do so. But this does not mean that a typical group of students dominates as a group agent. They are, instead, just a collection of individual agents. To be a group agent requires certain shared beliefs, attitudes, and intentions. The students may all despise the professor or believe the professor should leave and never come back; but they are not, in a typical classroom, organized together to act on these beliefs and feelings. This is obviously different from a situation where students have agreed together to drive the professor from campus if they are given even one more unexpected quiz. Because mere collections of people are not always organized to act together as a group agent, we are not dominated by the mere possibility of people ganging up on us.

But Thomas Simpson (2017) noticed the neorepublican insistence that governments are dominating tyrannies unless their citizens have power to control them, and that citizens have this power even when they are not organized together as a group agent according to Pettit and List’s standards for group agency. Simpson suggests we call citizens powerful enough to check their governments, even without sufficient organization for group agency, a team. When protesters spill into the streets to oppose their governments, they may not have agreed together to act on common beliefs, desires, and intentions. But, given some provoking event, their wills converge and we see dramatic action as a team.

Simpson thinks the possibility of team agency gives us another variety of the coalition problem. Aren’t we inevitably dominated by possible teams? Even if the aforementioned professor doesn’t face an organized gang of students ready to proceed according to plan if provoked, all professors face students who might spontaneously agree to chase them from campus. If it’s possible for students to form professor-persecuting teams, does this mean the domination of professors by students is inevitable after all?

Of course, there is obviously a difference between whatever vulnerability the typical professor faces before a room of students and the vulnerability, say, of a homeless person being stared down by a room full of wealthy diners after he walked into a posh restaurant, hoping to use the restroom. His felt vulnerability is real and entirely reasonable. Whatever mild vulnerability a typical professor feels may easily be transfigured into a wholesome sense of accountability. But how do we specify the difference? A handful of strategies are in play. and we will encounter them more than once.

The mainstream neorepublican approach is to solve the problem in terms of what agents are able to do, where any assessment of what we are able to do includes an accounting of the conditions for coordinated action with other agents. While a typical classroom full of students could (in some weak sense of could) force the professor out, unless there is a tradition or general understanding that such an attempt, if initiated, will be joined by other students, the students are a merely possible team. However much each student might want to, it is irrational for a typical student to believe that others will join them if they rise and charge the lectern. Professors need not take the possibility seriously and so are not dominated. However, a homeless person in a posh restaurant faces a latent team and latent teams have abilities suited to domination. A latent team, according to Lovett (2022, 33), is “a group of agents who for specific contextual reasons have already solved, or else are immanently poised to solve, the coordination problems standing in the way of joint intentional action”. Thus it is rational for patrons of a posh restaurant to expect other patrons and the restaurant staff to join them in expelling anyone rich people don’t want to see. This is because the patron is part of a latent team ready to become active. That the patrons will become collectively active in this way is not something the typical homeless person can ignore.

If the difference between merely possible teams and latent teams concerns common mutual understanding between fellow members of social groups (or the lack thereof), the difference between possible teams and latent teams is entangled with questions about the structure and norms of the social world at large. How is power manifest in the formation and constitution of social structures? What can we count on people around us to regard as acceptable or unacceptable behavior? An obvious difference between the professor and the homeless person is that the students probably believe they shouldn’t interfere with the professor and the restaurant patrons probably believe someone should interfere with the homeless person. To be a professor is to have at least nominal purchase on social status. This is clearly not the case for the homeless. How does potential domination by groups or teams relate to a social group’s common attitudes toward who has status and who lacks it, who commands respect and deference and who does not? (Also, see Sandven 2020.)

2.2 Domination by Structures, Systems, and Norms

Once we notice the relevance of social structures and social norms to questions about domination, it’s natural to wonder if structures and norms themselves dominate. That agents alone can be dominated isn’t disputed; but do agents alone dominate, whether as individuals, groups, or teams?

Neorepublicans like Pettit and Lovett are explicit: to be dominated just is to “stand in a certain relationship with some other agent” (Lovett 2022, 34) and “to be dominated is to have a master” (Lovett 2022, 63; 2010, 48–49; Pettit 1997, 72). To be dominated, according to what Lovett describes as the standard republican view, is a condition of dependence on the will of a specific agent or agents effectively organized for group/team agency. Because of this insistence on a two-way relation between specific agents or groups/teams, Rafeeq Hasan (2021) calls Pettit’s and Lovett’s theories dyadic.

Domination is a social complaint: that is, it is always a complaint against other people. Like all animals, we are vulnerable to bad weather and disease and other forms of mere misfortune, regardless of how other humans treat us. These vulnerabilities are not, in themselves, social ills (though they are often made much worse by the social worlds we inhabit). That is why we are not dominated by the weather or by disease except in a metaphorical way. But this does not settle the question of whether domination requires the presence of a specific dominator.

That the social structures we inhabit—with their constituent institutions, laws, norms, ideologies, et al.—have their particular shape is the contingent result of human activity, unlike our natural vulnerabilities to weather and disease. Are these social artifacts themselves ever the proper objects of domination complaints apart from the individuals they empower? Most will agree that social artifacts like those just listed may be unjust and so the appropriate target of normative criticism. Is the concept of domination useful here and perhaps even necessary?

Thinking of domination in terms of structures and systems rather than, or in addition to, particular agents emerged primarily as a critique of industrial capitalism. The movement Alex Gourevitch (2015) calls “labor republicanism” saw domination not only in the servile condition of particular workers to particular bosses, but in the very structure of capitalist society. Because “The land, the tools and materials of labor are still the exclusive property of the privileged few” wrote the author of the Journal of United Labor, “the worker cannot produce without giving himself a boss, or master”. Gourevitch recommends we think of this as a kind of “structural domination”.

The labor republican critique generalizes as an argument for domination beyond the interpersonal. Suppose I am not yet exposed to the power of a particular dominator, but I live in a society structured so that I cannot rationally refuse to enter a social relationship where I will be dominated (e.g. I cannot earn a living otherwise). So I am not free to refuse such a relationship. This lack of freedom cannot be explained by my vulnerability to a particular dominator, given that no such particular social relationship now exists. If this is correct, the affront to my freedom is the social structures that force me to enter a social relationship with a particular dominator. Hasan calls analogous cases to our attention, where the issue isn’t so much being forced to choose a “master” as being unable to escape social conditions in which you may be enslaved at any time (2021, 303–304; see also Vrousalis 2023, 37–114).

Karl Marx’s critiques of capitalism emerged alongside socialist republicanism and William Clare Roberts (2018) sees in them another theory of impersonal, systemic domination–essentially, domination by market forces. Speaking of markets in terms of power–that they have force or are forces, that it is possible to be exposed or vulnerable to such forces or be determined by them–is familiar. We might well wonder if they dominate. For Marx, on Roberts’ reading, they are analogous to the interpersonal domination highlighted by neorepublicans. When you are enslaved, your deliberative capacity is radically constrained, if not rendered completely inert, by dependence on the will of a “master”. Similarly, Marx claims, market forces make practical reasoning subject to the necessity of maximizing profits. Whatever you think best to produce or the best use of your talents, you must produce what is maximally profitable or be driven from the market by those who do. Also, the market, no less than slavers or tyrants, can be seen as closed to contestation. Someone might contest within it by bringing better or less expensive products to market, but this only reinforces and reproduces the market. (For criticism, see Vrousalis 2017 and Louette 2021.)

A more concrete contemporary analog to traditional mastery without agential dominators may be the condition of warehousing and delivery workers under the management of “algo[rithm]-bosses” (Varoufakis 2023). In some factories, management by human bosses has been replaced by algorithms, empowered to assign workloads and penalize workers through the reduction of paid hours or even termination if their human charges do not meet the algorithms’ self-generated standards of efficiency. Workers in these conditions typically have no way to contest the “decisions” of their automated supervisors (Varoufakis 2023, 77; see also Blunt 2015, 17–18).

While the labor republican tradition, with the Marxist themes Roberts highlights, sees systemic domination primarily as an affront to freedom of choice and the conditions of action, Dorothea Gädeke (2019, 2020, 2024) and Rafeeq Hasan (2021) tie domination conceptually to unequal standing before laws, norms, and social customs. We may encounter dominating power through interactions with individuals—Gädeke admits the possibility of interpersonal domination while Hasan claims individuals as such never dominate—but domination is essentially authorized by a society’s ascendant culture. For Gädeke, interpersonal power is domination only against a background of authorizing systems of belief and practice, and these authorizing systems dominate even those who do not face interpersonal domination. Even if a woman carefully avoids relationships that would put a specific man in a position to dominate her, she moves through a social world that interprets who she is and what she must do without authorizing her voice. If systems like patriarchy or slavery or apartheid are necessary for the existence of domination between agents, and given that authorizing systems often perdure through the uncoordinated confirmation and reinforcement of many individuals, it is tempting to think of such systems as impersonal domination. For example, it did not require intentional mass coordination for whites in the American south to maintain Jim Crow. Ordinary white southerners maintained Jim Crow “just being parents or teachers or salesmen or soldiers or priests — ordinary decent people” (McCabe 2002, 169) because it was in their perceived interests (whether material or symbolic) to do so. Certainly, the decision of an individual or an isolated group of individuals to treat me as an equal will not change how I am regarded by the social world at large.

The norm-confirming and norm-reinforcing activity of individuals, according to theorists like Gädeke and Hasan, is too diffuse to be group or team agency. There are many examples of the way particular agents seem to be mere conduits of systemic domination. Consider Vaclav Havel’s (1991, 136–138) grocer in Soviet-era Czechoslovakia. He posts slogans favorable to the regime in the window of his shop and so signals his cooperation with power while extending its reach (Lovett 2010; Krause 2013, Blunt 2015). Sharon Krause (2013, 194) offers the example of her mother’s insistence that she take smaller more “ladylike” steps and overcome her natural stride. Perhaps the ascendant patriarchal ideology her mother communicates and enforces is what dominates both mother and child (see also Foucault 1977, 26–27). Workers who have deeply imbibed the values of capitalism might be another example (see Thompson 2013 and 2015)—someone who accepts whatever meaningless work is available because their sense of self-worth depends on not being a “slacker”.

The standard neorepublican rejoinder is that possible examples of domination by systems or ideologies through agents are better understood as instances of domination by agents through systems or ideologies. Institutions, systems, and ideologies are sources of power that make domination possible rather than sites of domination. (The languages of sites vs. sources is Blunt’s 2015. See section 4.1 below.) Hasan (2021) calls this “the facilitation view”: social structures and systems facilitate domination but do not themselves dominate. According to the facilitation view, he claims, domination will be conceptually independent of its social conditions. Reduced to essences, there would be no difference between a slaver or tyrant and a back-alley bandit: the slaver or tyrant forces you to do what they say by force of law and custom, the bandit forces you to hand over your cash at gunpoint, but in both cases there is uncontrolled power of choice interference by one means or another. This kind of example has generated considerable churn in the recent literature, as we will see.

3. Does Domination Require the Exercise of Power?

3.1 Domination as a Power Structure

One of the most persistent recent disagreements concerns whether or not domination requires the exercise of power. As emphasized above, neorepublicans link domination to what agents are in a position to do or have the capacity to do rather than what agents actually do. The advantage of their account to liberals’ is supposed to be how neorepublicans highlight the threat of potential interference to freedom. Domination, says Lovett (2010), is in the structure rather than the outcomes of power. Whether or not an employer can fire their employees at will is about how the employer/employee relationship is structured; whether or not an employer actually fires an employee, or whether the employee manages not to starve because they have a job, are outcomes of the relationship. The emphasis on structures rather than outcomes draws our attention to the nature of power itself. We do not stop objecting to paradigmatic dominators merely because they promise to make gentle and judicious use of their powers. Emancipation requires that they cease to have their power. So, neorepublicans deny that self-regulation by the powerful can even reduce domination (Lovett 2010, 97). At an extreme, Pettit says that domination persists without “external checks that remove or replace the interference option or put it cognitively off the menu” and that domination is reduced only by “exogenous” forces. The only internal forces sufficient to reduce domination must “disable” in the manner of deep-seated neuroses (2012, 63). Nothing else meets the robustness requirement.

3.2 Does Character Matter after All?

That outcomes of power relations or the character of the empowered are not essentially relevant to domination faces two primary objections: first, that this fails to capture realities the dominated really object to; second, that this leads to significant over-generalization.

No one denies that victims of power object to its outcomes and not merely to their initial vulnerability. (Certainly, neorepublicans think both are objectionable.) But if we insist that domination properly refers only to the structure of power relations, and not to outcomes of those relations, we may have a difficult time explaining the standard use of domination to refer to overwhelming power wielded against the defenseless. Suppose Columbus merely sailed around the margins of the “New World” without making landfall and that his power to exploit and destroy native cultures was never exercised. Is this counterfactual history still a story of European domination? If not, shouldn’t we identify European domination with actual harm inflicted on people who were not equipped to resist (Katz 2017)?

Also, victims of domination specifically object to the character of their dominators. Christopher Lebron (2013) and Melvin Rogers (2020) highlight this. Rogers especially insists that theories of domination influenced by neorepublicanism overplay the irrelevance of character to dominating power. His recent work on black American republicans like Martin Delany (1852 [1968]), Hosea Easton (1837 [1999]), Maria W. Stewart (1987), David Walker (1829 [2003]), shows a contrasting emphasis on the “comportment” of white Americans. Opposing race-based systems of domination requires not just “freedom from the arbitrary power” of white Americans but a “transformation of the system of cultural value in which blacks occupy a lower position of worth” (Rogers 2020). This is transformation not only of the external checks on domination achievable by legal reforms, but a transformation of the hearts of white Americans. Rogers argues that neorepublican theories are best suited to diagnose the evils of political slavery, where the essential humanity of the enslaved is not necessarily questioned, unlike chattel slavery, which was constructed and maintained by ideological commitment to white supremacy and black inferiority. External checks may be sufficient to counter political slavery—they marshal society’s coercive power to enforce the already acknowledged value of the enslaved—but external sanctions alone, while necessary, cannot repair the systematic denial of this value.

3.3 Over-Generalization Problems for Structure-Based Accounts

Over-generalization worries are the most common objection to neorepublican approaches to domination. If domination is just the capacity for arbitrary interference, and given that such capacities seem ubiquitous, domination may be ordinary to the point of triviality. Even sitting around minding their own business, and coalition problems aside, gentle giants (Kramer 2008) and more ordinary varieties of the kindly and musclebound have the capacity to overpower weaker people; even if they never do, those with a natural gift for persuasion have the capacity to talk the gullible out of their savings (Friedman 2008: 251). Also, if the primary function of the state is to minimize domination, should neorepublicans get the state to hinder strength or persuasiveness? That is unsavory. An obvious fix is to insist that only “actual or attempted arbitrary interference” dominates (Friedman 2008: 252).

For some feminists, the over-generalization worry is specifically that neorepublicans make relationships of care and dependency unreasonably suspect. A caregiver who would not dream of harming their charges nevertheless has the capacity to: infecting wounds instead of cleaning them, throwing someone down the stairs instead of helping them up (Friedman 2008, 254 and Ferejohn 2001). Pettit acknowledges this feature of his theory when he claims that caring and uncaring parents alike dominate their children in a state of nature (Pettit 1999: 119–120). The alternative is to insist that though care providers may stand in a relationship of unequal power with a vulnerable dependent, unless this power is abused it does not dominate. Domination, instead of mere power, requires active violation of moral standards and/or compromising the best interests of others (Kittay 1999: 33–34).

The attractiveness of this alternate depends on how we understand powers or capacities. If A has a power or capacity to interfere so long as it is possible in any sense for A to do so, as Pettit sometimes suggests, criticism focusing on the value of care is damaging. Clearly, it is physically possible for caregivers and parents to interfere with their dependents. If, however, A does not have the power to interfere so long as appropriate penalties are in place for such interference, the objection may not be very potent. In other words, it’s not mere possibility that matters, but social or legal possibility—roughly, what it is possible to do without risk of sanction from other members of your social group (see List & Valentini 2016). A hallmark of feminist ethics and political philosophy is insistence that power relations inside the home often manifest domination even though the home can be a center of loving care and dependence, and that legal or social sanctioning of spousal/child abuse reduces domination (Costa 2013: 928). Such laws, of course, do not make interference impossible simpliciter; instead, it makes interference risky and potentially costly. In Lovett’s (2022) language, such sanctions help make caregivers who would harm their dependents ignorable. (See also Kirby 2016.)

Also, shifting from domination as mere power to domination as abuse of power may lead to other unattractive results, especially given broadly feminist commitments. If domination requires actual or attempted interference, women who avoid interference by “seduction, ingratiation, [or] avoidance” aren’t dominated (Costa 2013: 926). This feature of neorepublican accounts—the insistence that domination is the “mere condition of being vulnerable”—may be exactly what makes the concept useful for feminist philosophy (Laborde 2008: 152).

There are other proposed counterexamples to the claim that the “capacity to interfere … at will” dominates (Shapiro 2016: 21). What about “a playground bully” who is “able to beat up any of the smaller children but is widely known only to beat up black children”? Does the bully dominate the white children just as much as the black children? What about someone like 1950s American senator Joe McCarthy? He had the same power to interfere in the lives of right-wing and left-wing Americans but citizens on the left had far more reason to fear him. Perhaps the intuitive judgment here is that the bully only dominates the black children, and that McCarthy only dominates left-wing citizens. (Both examples are from Ian Shapiro 2012: 324; 2016: 21). The persuasiveness of these examples depends in part on whether we think domination is the sole political evil, at least in the sense that all other political evils can be addressed most effectively by minimizing domination. The black children and the left-wing citizens in Shapiro’s examples are obviously worse off than the white children/right-wing citizens. If we diagnose their condition only by reference to domination, Shapiro’s examples are more damaging. This is true even though there may not be much practical space between Shapiro’s account of domination and Pettit’s. Shapiro too speaks of domination as a complaint against a “power relationship” and sees vulnerability to domination, like domination itself, as an injustice (2016: 22). This is close to what Pettit calls “virtual domination” (1997, 54).

This controversy aside, there is broad consensus that you can be dominated even if nobody is actively dominating you at the moment. Even if there is no domination without an actual display of power over you or people like you at some time, domination might persist when unexercised precisely because of its previous exercise. As Wartenberg (1990) says, the actual exercise of power can “condition” a social relationship in a “longstanding” manner. If power has been exercised over you in the past, or over someone like you (perhaps because you are both members of a subordinated social group), this will affect how you relate to those in power. For example, suppose you know that the boss can fire you at will. He has not fired you or even threatened to do so, and so has not actually exercised this power over you. Even so, you have seen him exercise this power over other employees. As a result, you do whatever you’re told for fear of what the boss can do to you and has done to others. If so, domination might not require the active exercise of power against you but require the active exercise of power against someone relevantly like you. Of course, this leads to further questions: e.g., How recent must active exercises of power be in order to condition ongoing social relationships where power is dormant? Such questions have received relatively little attention thus far. (But see Hirschmann 2003.)

3.4 Structure as Status

“Does a Mugger Dominate?”, Dorothea Gädeke asks (2019). It depends, she says. When we understand what it depends on, we thereby solve the primary overgeneralization problems afflicting neorepublican theories of domination. A mugger may have an uncontrolled power to interfere, but that doesn’t tell us all we need to know. After all, imagine that the mugger is someone just now escaped from slavery in the antebellum American south, and the person mugged is an elderly slaver. The former might be able to beat the latter to death if he doesn’t hand over his money. At least here and now, he has an uncontrolled power to interfere. Even so, he is very plausibly the dominated and not the dominating power. He may have what Gädeke calls “an opportunistic capacity to interfere” in this isolated encounter, but he is marked as vulnerable by the social world and the slaver is not. Marked how? By social norms that allow him to be treated as chattel and a legal system that enforced property rights to human bodies (obviously, this is an incomplete accounting). Even if he escapes the clutches of any particular slaver, he is dominated given the failure of his social world to acknowledge and protect his equal status—the failure manifest partially in Black Republican concerns with white “comportment”.

The question, according to Gädeke, of whether senators dominate leftists, or bullies dominate black children, or caregivers dominate their charges, cannot be answered simply by reference to powers of choice interference. The question, instead, involves background structures of normative permission, standing, and accountability. As we have seen, Gädeke and Hasan see these structures themselves as sites of domination apart from the ways they enable interpersonal power.

Neorepublican invocations of structure typically explain the costs and risks of interference. The difference, for Gädeke, concerns what is structured. What matters to the structure of domination isn’t primarily what happen between individual agents, their strategic relatedness, opportunity sets, etc. Instead, what matters is the sources of power in “socially produced hierarchies” that “prestructure” interactions in terms of unequal status (Gädeke 2024). She emphasizes her continuity with a theme that always had a place—if not pride of place—in Pettit’s neorepublicanism: domination compromises equal status. When you are dominated, you face more than at-will power to interfere with your choices; you are deprived of “the ability to command attention and respect” and of “standing among persons” (Pettit 2002) and so are not treated as “a voice worth hearing and an ear worth addressing” (Pettit 2012).

So, should we think of domination first as a threat to an agent’s choice situation and concern ourselves with that agent’s status only as a reflection of their potentially dominated choices? Or, instead, should we think of domination first as a threat to an agent’s equal status and worry about dominated choices only insofar as they reflect diminished status?

The way we answer these questions about dominating social structure is directly relevant to recent discussions of “mutual domination”. Neorepublicans used to assume, if not always argue, that domination requires inequalities of social power. Andreas Schmidt (2018) challenged this orthodoxy. Even if A and B are equally powerful, both may have an uncontrolled power to interfere with the other’s choices. In a state of nature, Schmidt says, two gunslingers mutually dominate even if they are exactly matched as shootists. Whoever gets the draw on the other can end their agency altogether—the most dramatic choice interference imaginable. It follows that, if domination is a kind of uncontrolled capacity to interfere with choice, two agents may equally possess this capacity and so mutually dominate. If, however, the structure that matters to domination concerns the unequal distribution of respect, status, and normative authority in the social world, equalized capacities for choice interference will be underdescribed for purposes of diagnosing domination, just like mugger/muggee dyads.

Schmidt’s examples may represent a fissure between neorepublicanism and other attempts to theorize domination going forward. Callum Zavos MacRae (2024) argues that the gunslingers display mutual arbitrary will dependence but not domination, because dependence on an arbitrary will was never the correct analysis of the Paradigms. The social ill characteristic of slavers, patriarchs, and tyrants was always an essentially egalitarian complaint—a complaint against unequal status. (For an argument that Schmidt’s examples involve unequal power after all, see Bengston 2022.)

4. What Kind of Power Is Domination?

If domination concerns how social relationships are structured, what is A in a position to do if A dominates B? If domination requires the exercise of power, how does A use their power when they dominate B? If domination is essentially structural and systemic, what kinds of structures and systems constitute domination?

Along one dimension, we can sort answers to these questions into the moralized vs. the non-moralized. For a moralized theory, identifying domination requires us to settle more foundational questions about what is morally right or wrong, just or unjust. For example, to claim that dominating power is the power to violate human rights makes our theory of domination depend on a theory of human rights—obviously a moral theory. Non-moralized theories specify domination without reference to theories of the right or the good. For example, if we say that dominating power is power over the means of production, our theory of domination will depend on a [plausibly] descriptive theory of what counts as control of the means of production. (We often make moral judgments involving non-moralized terms. I might claim that “Plagiarism is always wrong” and not necessarily claim that the correct conception of plagiarism is moralized. When asked what plagiarism is, I might say “Plagiarism is the misrepresentation of someone else’s academic work as your own” or something along those lines. Given that this conception of plagiarism does not itself include claims about what’s right or wrong, it is non-moralized even if I also think plagiarism is always wrong. Thanks to my colleague Sam Duncan for suggesting this example.)

Of course, those who define domination without making moral judgments aren’t committed to what Ian Carter calls “value-independence” about the phenomenon or “the complete detachment of our analysis from all ethical concerns” (2015: 280–281). Contemporary discussion of domination, from all-comers, is generally motivated by profound ethical concerns.

Sorting is also required along another dimension. In addition to questions of moralization or non-moralization, there is the question of how domination relates to norms, rules, and supposed authority, or to the use of power to dictate norms or claim authority. Is domination always an attempt to rule? Does domination always involve a claim—however mistaken—by dominators that their power is legitimate? Does domination always involve demands that the dominated conform to norms? Answering any of these questions in the affirmative is to advocate a norm-dependent theory of domination.

Confusion is easy here, given that moralized theories often appeal to norms and rules. The difference between moralized theories and non-moralized but norm-dependent theories depends on the difference between correct moral norms/rules as distinguished from the general social phenomenon of norms or rules. Norm-dependent theories say that domination always involves power exercised through norms and rules that some regard as legitimate—perhaps the dominator, perhaps the dominated, or perhaps both. As we will see, for theories that are not just norm-dependent but also moralized, domination always involves a failure to respect the moral status of agents as sources of the norms that govern them. For a merely norm-dependent theory, the domination of a patriarch might be essentially connected to the patriarch’s claim that he deserves obedience from his family. Obviously, whether or not someone claims or doesn’t claim to deserve obedience is a merely descriptive matter. As a result, such a theory is not moralized. The legitimacy of the patriarch’s authority is merely sociological, not moral. If a theory of domination says instead that the patriarch dominates because his demand for obedience unjustly undermines the right of his spouse and children to shape the norms that govern them, that theory is both norm-dependent and moralized. A theory that depends in part on an account of unjust infringements is clearly moralized.

Sorting theories into these categories is complicated by the fact that whether a theory is moralized or norm-dependent is sometimes a matter of active controversy. (This has particularly been true of Pettit’s theory of domination.) In what follows, sorting will reflect the intentions of the theorist—at least as far as these intentions can be discerned.

Once we recognize the distinction between moralization and norm-dependency, we end up with four categories of answer to the question “What kind of power is domination?” These are offered as types and necessarily elide specifics of different theories.

	Norm-Independent	Norm-Dependent
Non-Moralized	Being dominated is vulnerability to varieties of choice interference or coercion.	Being dominated is vulnerability to socially legitimized power.
Moralized	Being dominated is vulnerability to forms of moral wrong.	Being dominated is vulnerability to socially legitimized power that denies your moral status.

This section will examine theories from each division, with their basic motivations and primary exemplars.

4.1 Non-Moralized, Norm-Independent Theories

Neorepublicanism tends away from moralization and norm-dependence. If A has a great deal of power over B, A will be well positioned to wrong B, or to force B to act like A has authority, but non-moralized/norm-independent theories maintain that this is not essential to domination. What is essential? Roughly, that A has an unchecked or uncontrolled power to impose their will on B, to shape the framework of choices available to B so that B is highly likely to cooperate with A. The disagreements among non-moralized/norm-independent theorists are about the kind of checks or control that might prevent domination, and about how imposition works.

Most non-moralized/norm-independent theories follow in the wake of neorepublicanism and share its basic approach by theorizing domination in two movements: first identifying a kind of power manifest in domination but also in non-dominating social relationships, then identifying the feature of domination that separates it from the power manifest in those non-dominating relationships. Usually, the second movement describes the controls or checks present in non-dominating social relationships and absent from the dominating ones. These two movements will be treated in order below.

First, what kind of social power is of interest to a theory of domination? We have seen the way neorepublicans like Pettit and Lovett focus on the capacity to interfere with or frustrate an individual’s choices. Pettit uses the language of choice replacement, removal, and/or misrepresentation. A can interfere with B’s choices by removing potential objects of choice: running over B’s bicycle and destroying it removes B’s option “ride my bike”. Knifing B’s bike tire replaces B’s option of riding their bike with another option: riding it after the tire is repaired. Removal and replacement are both objective forms of choice interference. The misrepresentation of options is cognitive: e.g. A tells B only idiots ride bikes. If B is credulous and easily cowed, A interferes with B’s choices by misrepresenting them. (see Pettit 2012).

This general emphasis on choice provokes the over-generalization worries already discussed (Shapiro 2012; Friedman 2008; Blunt 2015; McCammon 2015). Some choices clearly have more weight than others. Obviously, having no choice about where to sit in a café doesn’t matter compared to having no choice about where to live. Connecting the former as well as the latter to dominating varieties of choice-interference because both might represent the removal or replacement of an option cheapens the idea of domination. If, however, we want to keep domination and the reduction of freedom conceptually connected, there is reason to see domination in all power to interfere, at least when that power is outside the control of the interferee. (But see Lazar 2023.)

Furthermore, while Pettit analyzes domination in terms of choice-interference, his favorite heuristic focuses directly on dominated agents and the way they are social related to their dominators. To be dominated, for Pettit, is to fail “the eyeball test”: you cannot “look others in the eye without reason for the fear or deference that a power of interference might inspire” (2012: 84).

Lovett’s early work on domination emphasized social relatedness as a precondition of domination. A’s social relatedness to B, first of all, seems to require strategic relatedness, in the sense that what B is likely to do is a function in part of what A does. To get from social relatedness to domination has other requirements. At this stage of his work, Lovett agreed that A could not dominate B unless is an asymmetry of power within their social relationship. Further, for A to have power over B plausibly requires that B cannot easily exit the relationship. If someone can easily get a new job just as good as the one they have already, their “exit costs” are low and they will have a correspondingly low dependence on the social relationship—probably too low for domination to occur (Lovett 2010). It may be that A’s power over B, and B’s exit costs from their social relationship, are not really separate conditions, that A’s power over B is a function of A’s control of resources B cannot access except through A (see Pansardi 2013). More recently (2022), Lovett favors the language of “choice frustration” and has also abandoned the requirement of unequal power between A and B in light of Schmidt’s (2018) arguments for the possibility of mutual domination.

McCammon (2015), motivated primarily by the concern not to undermine domination’s moral seriousness and to avoid problems of “cheap domination”, shifts focus from choice interference toward forms of power suited to coercion. Power enough to dominate, as Scott Anderson (2010, 28) says of coercion, is “suited to stop a person from pursuing her aims regardless of her motives or reasons”. McCammon calls this impositional power. Power is impositional to the degree that it warrants confidence that the will of one agent can simply be replaced by the will of another. This, for McCammon, is the kind of “dependence on the will of another” that should trouble neorepublicans. Paradigm dominators wield such terrible power because they can “attach costs to noncooperation higher than the costs of cooperation” even if the costs of the latter are nigh unbearable. (For criticism, see Lazar 2023 and Gädeke 2024.)

A capacity for choice-interference, or social relatedness however rendered, or power suited to imposition, is necessary but not sufficient for domination on a non-moralized/norm-independent theory. There are, it is generally agreed, benign forms of each. The malignancy of domination comes from something more.

Neorepublicans first referred to this “something more” as the arbitrariness of dominating power and still do with some regularity, but Pettit himself now favors the language of control or the absence of control (2012: 57–58). This move emphasized the non-moralized nature of his theory. (For criticism connected to this shift in Pettit’s presentation, see especially Christman 1998, Costa 2007, and McMahon 2005.) The terminological shift was wise, given the natural tendency to contrast arbitrary power with power backed by good reasons or power put to good purpose. Arbitrary power, for neorepublicans, has never been merely unreasoned power. Though Pettit earlier emphasized the connection between arbitrary power and power that fails to track the “interests” of those subject to it, he measured interests by appeal to “avowed” or “avowal-ready” interests (2006: 275–276), not by an independent notion of the objectively good or reasonable. The language of control also has echoes in his earlier work. For example, in Republicanism he says that an act is arbitrary “by virtue of the controls—or more precisely the lack of controls—under which it materializes” (1997: 55). This shift toward domination as uncontrolled power follows Pettit’s more recent attempts to contrast domination with well-constructed democracy, but the opposition of democratically constrained power and dominating power reflects his earlier insistence that we cannot know when power is arbitrary except “by recourse to public discussion in which people may speak for themselves and for the groups to which they belong” (1997: 56). Here, too, he connects his own theory to Iris Young’s account of domination in Justice and the Politics of Difference. Young says that domination is the “opposite” of “thorough social and political democracy” and defines life within structures of domination as living under others who “can determine without reciprocation the conditions of [the dominated person’s] actions, either directly or by virtue of the structural consequences of their actions” (1990 [2011: 38]).

For a non-moralized theory, identifying domination as anti-democratic must involve a non-moralized account of democracy. This is not necessarily a problem because we can describe political institutions as “democratic” in a merely descriptive sense. (Someone who says, “The expansion of the franchise leads to a more democratic society” might simply mean that a larger percentage of the population gets to vote and think that is a terrible idea and a reason not to expand the franchise.) More difficult is showing how even broadly democratic states are non-dominating if we think the absence of domination involves literal control of the state by those it governs. The vast majority of individual citizens do not control their state in any meaningful way. Given the enormity of contemporary states, it is unclear how they could. We might say that they should rest content with a fair share of control, or with a fair chance at control. But this looks very much like a way of moralizing the theory, since fairness is clearly a moral notion. (Pettit’s primary attempt to explain non-domination in terms of democratic political arrangements is contained in the final three chapters of On the People’s Terms. For more interpretation and criticism of Pettit’s idea of control, see Arnold & Harris 2017, Mayer 2015, Schink 2013, Sharon 2015, Simpson 2017, and Kolodny 2019, For an argument that neorepublican statism is inconsistent with non-domination, see Kinna and Prichard 2019).

In his earlier work, Lovett argued that avoiding domination does not require democracy so long as the powerful are subject to public and reliably enforced rules. Perhaps democracy does, in fact, most effectively reduce domination, but this should follow from substantive argument, not from the mere analysis of concepts (Lovett 2010). Lovett offered the following case as evidence of how suitably publicized and enforced rules reduce domination even when they fail to express the will of the subordinated:

Suppose that for various historical, economic, and cultural reasons, one group in some society manages to acquire a preponderance of social power, which it wields over the other groups in that society directly and without constraint, much to its own benefit. Since the subordinate groups are in no position directly to challenge the preeminence of the powerful group, they instead demand only that the various rights and privileges of the latter be written down, codified, and impartially enforced by independent judges. In time, let us suppose, the powerful group accedes to this demand, on the view that since the rules will be designed to benefit them, after all, there will be no significant cost in their doing so. (2012: 147)

If power is organized and systematized in law, it does sound odd to call it arbitrary. After all, it may be entirely predictable. Here, Lovett tacked closer to the commonsense idea that what is arbitrary is unreasoned or unfettered by rules. At this stage, he was willing to say that “real-world systems of domination” like Jim Crow and South African apartheid might cease to be dominating in possible worlds where they managed “strict adherence to explicit rules and procedures” (2010: 101). That such regimes would remain oppressive is obvious, but this might be explained by other political evils than domination. Instead of a substantive account of arbitrary power—where power dominates when it isn’t forced to track the will of those subject to it—he recommends proceduralism: power dominates because it isn’t “reliably constrained by effective rules, procedures, or goals that are common knowledge to all persons or groups concerned” (Lovett 2010: 96–97; 2012. For more treatment of the debate between Pettit and Lovett about the nature of arbitrary power, see the section on ‘arbitrary’ power in the entry on republicanism.)

Lovett’s arguments for proceduralism have provoked several clarifications of what substantivism requires. Proceduralism highlights what Gwilym David Blunt (2015) calls “sources” of domination that are personal as opposed to social and “sites” of domination that are interactional as opposed to systemic. Sources of domination, for Blunt, concern the derivation of dominating power—i.e. does A dominate B because of A’s own stockpile of deadly weapons? Does A dominate B because of A’s place in a social hierarchy? The former is a personal and the latter a social source of domination. Sites concern the locus of domination—i.e. does the domination occur between agents? Between an agent and an institution? The former is an interactional and the latter a systemic site of domination. Widely known and reliably enforced checks on power, of the kind emphasized by proceduralism, really do reduce domination enabled by personal sources of power like A’s possession of more guns or guile than B, especially when this power is expressed in the interactions of A and B as individual agents. If A and B are neighbors, and A has a huge stockpile of weapons and B has none, it makes sense to think of B’s complaint against A as a matter of their intense vulnerability to power constrained only by A’s whims. Substantivism may be better equipped to recognize domination in what Blunt calls social “sources” and systemic “sites”. In actual systems of domination, A often has power over B not because A alone has more power (e.g., by having more guns of their own), but because A and B both live within a system intended to advantage A’s group and disadvantage B’s. Often, A has power to adjust the system, or access to such power, while B does not. Of course, if we think of power to adjust the system in terms of the system’s norms or governing principles, this will bring a theory of domination very close to norm-dependence, if not moralization.

There is another way to account for proceduralism’s insistence that reliably enforced, common-knowledge rules reduce domination even without democratic constraints. When A alone decides whether and how to harass B, A’s power to harass B is checked only by A’s sense of what is best or what should be done. Suppose A lives in a society that introduces a reliably enforced, common-knowledge rule that A can harass B only by putting B in the stocks but may not whip B. This changes the situation both for A and B. Now, A alone does not decide whether and how to harass B: now, A is not checked simply by what A thinks they have reason to do. In this way, A’s power is less “deliberatively isolated” (McCammon 2015). Lovett’s more recent work shares this emphasis. Proceduralism about domination, in Lovett’s The Well-Ordered Republic, involves multiform ways of reducing how B’s practical situation depends on what A does or doesn’t do: “the idea is simply that any sort of public constraint on the ability of one person or group to frustrate the choices of another might count as suitable” for the reduction of domination (2022, 56).

If this is right, domination can be reduced even by non-democratic reforms. However, laws and other limits on individual power may be formed by whole groups in a deliberatively isolated manner, as under Jim Crow and apartheid, if the members of A’s group have input into the rules, but the members of B’s group do not. Empowered groups often dictate the terms of their dealings with subordinated groups based only on their own sense of how things should be, and the deliberatively isolated power of groups may be strengthened by measures that reduce the deliberative isolation of individuals. As we will see, norm-dependent and moralized theories insist that this supposed normative authority is essential to domination.

4.2 Moralized, Norm-Independent Theories

Norm-independent, moralized theories of domination are less influential than non-moralized varieties. Even so, their appeal is easy to see. There is straightforward reason to moralize domination: i.e., dominators use their power to do bad things. So-called masters sexually assault the enslaved. Men within patriarchy sexually assault women. Domination allows evil deeds go unpunished. This impunity is perhaps what matters most to moralized theories. Of course, not every instance of wrongdoing manifests domination. When a slaver tortures the enslaved, this is domination; but when the latter gets the drop on a slaver and tortures him it may not be, even on the assumption that both cases of torture are wrong. Why? The difference is in what the slaver will face as a consequence for torturing the enslaved, as opposed to what the enslaved will face for torturing the slaver. The slaver wrongs the enslaved with impunity; the enslaved wrongs the slaver only at grave risk from the enforcers of the system that enslaves her. To get domination instead of wrongdoing, it is necessary to include a requirement like this: as a first pass, A dominates B just because A can wrong B with impunity. A will be well-positioned to exercise control over B. B will know that refusal to comply with A may result in violation of B’s rights or interests.

A theory will be moralized but norm-independent insofar as what explains the presence or absence of domination is the actual moral wrongness of power or its uses, not its social endorsement or condemnation. The latter has only incidental connection to actual right or wrong. However, the requirement that domination involve impunity will make the theory instable in the direction of norm-dependence. What a social world will punish, what it endorses or condemns, looks very much like a question of social legitimation.

The most common approaches to moralization without norm-dependence couch domination in terms of violating “basic” or “best” interests. Allen (1999), Lukes (2005), and Wartenberg (1990) are primary advocates of a “basic” interests approach. Kittay (1999: 34), Laborde (2013: 285), and Shapiro (2012: 310; 2016: 23) share an emphasis on “best” interests. Shapiro looks to local custom for guidance about the standard for legitimate power unless those customs dramatically undercut the interests of the less powerful. For example, he is happy to leave judgments of legitimate parental power to parents, except for those who would deny their children education and healthcare. The baseline is what is necessary to live as “a normal adult” in the context of contemporary democracies (2012: 294). Laborde moralizes basic interests by appeal to what “we have reason to value” (2013: 285), as opposed to what people might actually value. A non-moralized account of basic interests, of course, might connect interests to what people actually value, regardless of what they have reason to value. But this would leave us in the awkward position of being unable to recognize domination in the sufficiently brainwashed or propagandized.

Samuel Arnold and John Harris defend what they call “interest substantivism”—this, they say, is Pettit’s earliest and best conception of non-arbitrary power. Instead of non-domination as essentially tied to the control of power, or power exercised only in accord with a democratically-accessed will of the people, their substantivism tracks “the interests of the public” or “what is good for us—good for all of us—as citizens” (2017, 12). The difficulty, according to Lovett (2022) is that such accounts might collapse concern with domination into concern with the shape of the common good. If we discern what the common good really is, there is no place left for a specific worry about domination. Now, even having achieved an adequate understanding of the common good, there is still the question of how best to secure it, or to ensure that the use of power is robustly controlled so it always tracks this understanding. Another standard objection is that what counts as the common good is intrinsically contested, so the exercise of power in the name of the supposedly common good will inevitably be experienced by some as the imposition of someone else’s will, and so as dominating. An alternative is to conceive of the common good, as Victoria Costa (2019) recommends, exclusively in opposition to actions that involve “prima facie wrongness”. Perhaps domination only occurs when someone is in a position to worsen our choice situation in ways common sense regards as immoral. If so, we would need to assume that common sense about what is prima facie wrong—perhaps here and now—is not itself a manifestation of dominating power. Certainly, theories of domination from the Marxist or critical theoretic tradition will dispute this.

4.3 Non-Moralized, Norm-Dependent Theories

When we take a hard look at the most obvious cases of domination—masters, tyrants, patriarchs—we will probably notice they all claim authority. The Paradigms all think of themselves as the ones who make the rules, and that their subjects have an obligation to comply. To say that domination, as such, always involves this kind of authority claim is a standard way to endorse a norm-dependent theory: A dominates B by having a kind of socially legitimate power over them. Alternately, as we have seen, some theorists claim that we can be dominated by socially legitimized norms or practices themselves.

Not all social power operates through norms—or doesn’t seem to. The neighborhood mob boss who comes by your shop demanding protection money almost certainly does not expect you to take his command “Pay up or else!” as an expression of legitimate authority. The typical mob boss cares only that you recognize him as a source of credible threats and comply. According to most norm-dependent theories, this means the mob boss does not dominate. (Hasan 2021, for example, is perfectly explicit about this.) Domination is always power “under color of right”. The mob boss acts under no such colors—he is one of Gädeke’s muggers who fail to dominate. The patriarch, by contrast, is empowered by his society to expect his commands to obligate those within his household; and this—not merely his power to interfere with choice—is why he dominates. Here, norm-dependent theories part company from their norm-independent competitors: the latter will tend to see both the mob boss and the patriarch as sources of domination.

As canvassed above, norm-dependence and moralization are separate issues. We don’t need a theory of the right or the good to tell us whether someone has power legitimized by local social norms or laws. Of course, we do need a moral theory to tell us if social norms or laws are right or just or truly legitimate. As we will see in the next section, the most influential norm-dependent theories of domination tie it to a specific failure to respect the actual moral authority of the dominated, and so offer a moralized as well as norm-dependent theory.

Why prefer norm-dependence to norm-independence? Often, the move to norm-dependence is motivated by familiar worries about over-generalization. I may have an uncontrolled power to interfere with your choices whenever I can take the last seat in a café before you; this obviously has nothing to do with any kind of authority over you. The latter power seems less ubiquitous and more serious.

Also, norm-dependent, non-moralized conceptions are perhaps best equipped to diagnose domination where the dominated have internalized justifications for their status. Neorepublicans often highlight how victims of domination don’t have enough power to contest their position, but what about cases where victims of domination are unwilling to contest because they accept a worldview that justifies their domination? Michael Thompson calls such unwillingness a manifestation of constitutive domination: the way “norms, institutions, and values of the community shape the rationality of subjects to accept forms of power and social relations and collective goals as legitimate forms of authority” (2018: 44). In so doing, he resists standard neorepublican talk of “arbitrary” power. Domination is constitutive just because it is not regarded as arbitrary by those under its sway. Instead, he claims, domination is the expression of widely rationalized and internalized norms. Hasan even says that chattel slavery would have been an institution of “mere force” instead of domination had no one “ever and in any way” regarded slavers power as legitimate (2021, 311). Certainly, if we agree that all power necessarily involves legitimacy claims (see Azmanova 2012: 49–50), it makes sense to think that intense varieties of social power, like domination, will go hand-in-hand with thoroughgoing acceptance of legitimacy claims.

Thompson thinks neorepublicans are misled by their paradigms. Neorepublicans get their touchstones of domination from slavery and traditional despotism—varieties supposedly more prevalent in pre-modern societies, where the threat of violence was the primary currency of domination. Instead, he says, we should see domination in the ideologies that make violence and coercion less necessary: for example, when the redistribution of public goods to private elites is widely accepted as natural or as the result of free exchange, even by many who suffer as a result.

The internalization by the dominated of norms supposedly legitimizing their domination is not the only way to connect domination to internalized norms. According to Christopher Lebron, what is necessary isn’t that the dominated accept a rationalization of their condition, but that the dominators do so. The difference between domination and more benign hierarchies, he claims, is that dominators control “legitimizing myths” that hide their domination. The simple fact that a worker has a boss does not indicate domination; it may instead indicate only a mutually beneficial arrangement (Lebron 2013: 56). A boss comes to dominate by accepting and promoting myths that justify their position. What matters is that the dominating group imbibe such myths, that their consciousness is shaped so that their power is mistaken for a feature of nature, or a result of their innate merits or just deserts.

The norm-dependent theories encountered so far look to institutions and systems to embody and promote social norms. Regardless of whether institutions and systems themselves dominate, standard norm-dependent theories see the existence of institutions as a necessary condition for domination through norms: (e.g.) the patriarch’s power to project authority in his family depends on widely accepted attitudes about the place of fathers in the institution of the family. Gwilym David Blunt’s theory stands apart by being norm-dependent without requiring background institutions. According to Blunt, even the mob boss has power over norms: in the language introduced above, this is an interactional site of domination drawn from a personal source: i.e., power between agents drawn from the mob boss’ personal control of guns and muscle. Unlike norm-independent theorists such as Lovett, Blunt claims that all social relationships involve norms. Insofar as the mob boss and the shop owner are socially related, this involves more than non-normative elements like strategic relatedness or exit costs. The asymmetry of power that matters is an asymmetry in the power to define the status of other parties in a social relationship. The mob boss has power enough to assign the shop owner an inferior place in their social relationships, and set up himself as the one who makes the rules in the relationship. In this way, Blunt believes he can preserve the standard neorepublican intuition that powerful agents like the mob boss can be dominators within a norm-dependent framework.

4.4 Moralized, Norm-Dependent Theories

We don’t have to appeal to moral concepts to say whether a powerful person can or cannot dictate social norms; but, for an influential cluster of theories, the norm-dependence of domination is constructed in specifically moral terms. This is an understandable move. After all, if we think domination is always expressed through norms, and we think that domination is morally illegitimate even when socially legitimate, it makes sense to think of domination as a specific failure to reckon with morally legitimate norms. For theories of domination that are moralized as well as norm-dependent, we diagnose domination not just as power expressed through authority claims, but as a specific kind of morally illegitimate authority.

Gädeke’s more recent interventions, canvassed in previous sections, continue to develop themes in earlier moralized/norm-dependent theories, particularly Rainer Forst’s. Forst and Henry Richardson worked either within or in direct response to neorepublicanism and offer a similar two-movement approach to domination; first giving an account of power manifest in domination but also in benign forms of power, and second, giving an account of what makes domination distinct and unjust. For Richardson, the broader category of benign or even legitimate power is the power to “modify the rights and duties of others” (2002: 34). Dominators exercise an unauthorized variety of this “normative power”. Richardson is motivated again by the desire to steer around what he thinks are neorepublican false positives: criminals like the mob boss do not, he claims, dominate. If an uncontrolled capacity to interfere with choice dominates, we are dominated by the mere possibility that our neighbors will slash our tires in the night. Secret tire-slashing may be arbitrary choice-interference, but it serves no obvious role in wielding normative power.

Forst favors the language of reasons in identifying the broader category of power of which domination is a subset. All social power, he says, is power “within the space of reasons”—specifically justifying reasons. This is why he calls his account of power noumenal: power is not based merely on the control of material resources, but instead on influence over what other agents see as justified thought or action. That you have a lot of some material resource—say, money—is irrelevant from the perspective of power unless you can use it to alter what others think they have most reason to do. In general, Forst says, power is “the capacity of A to motivate B to think or do something that B would otherwise not have thought or done” (2015: 115). It is clear enough that such power has innocent varieties: when a teacher shows a student a new way to solve a math problem, they motivate them to think and do in ways they would not otherwise. Gentle persuasion between friends manifests the same power.

So, both Richardson and Forst try to situate domination within a broader, essentially normative phenomenon, the power to place others under [supposed] duties or the power to affect what others regard as justified. What, then, makes domination distinct and unjust? For both Richardson and Forst, domination involves a violation of our rights relative to the normative domain. Dominators claim authority or power within the space of reasons that properly belongs to the dominated. Domination is power unbound by the moral standing of its victims as co-authors of the norms that bind them. For Richardson, who focuses specifically on power in the political context, the arbitrariness of normative power manifests itself along several moralized dimensions: dominating power fails to express “fair” deliberative processes among “free and equal citizens” that respect “fundamental rights and liberties” (2002: 52). The slaver dominates because he takes for himself a power that belongs properly to the enslaved: we have a moral right to decide together what our political rights and duties will be. He is able to do this because his role as a master of slaves has institutional support. If one of his slaves runs away, he can call on the state to track the slave down and return them. This is how real dominators are distinct from deluded claimants to normative power. Imagine a mob boss who comes to believe that he speaks for God. He might believe that he has a power to create rights and duties; even so, without social and legal backing analogous to what a tyrant or slaver or patriarch can depend on, the mob boss will not succeed even in creating illegitimate rights and duties—and so will fail to dominate on a theory like Richardson’s. (For more argument expounding a conceptual connection between non-domination and rights, see Layman 2021 and Pala 2024.)

Similarly, Forst measures dominating power against an explicitly moralized baseline—power dominates to the extent that it is exercised outside a structure of democratic institutions designed to secure and respect the equal authority of each citizen to offer and receive adequate justifications (Forst 2013). Noumenal power within social relationships becomes domination when agents within that relationship are denied their right to justification: i.e., their right to participate as free equals in the space of reasons (2015: 116–117). Interestingly, Forst’s theory, like Blunt’s non-moralized theory and unlike Richardson’s and Gädeke’s, apparently allows for domination outside official structures of authority. Dominators, Forst says, “seal off” the space of reasons by denying our right to receive and offer adequate justifications, but there are many ways to do this. One way is simply through the threat of violence. If a mob boss has all the guns and muscle, he will be able to crowd the shop owner completely out of the justificatory space. What the shop owner might believe about what they have reason to think and do is irrelevant, given the price they will pay for non-compliance.

Again, if we understand the power required for domination as a kind of authority, it makes sense to diagnose the presence or absence of domination in terms of illicit authority. When illicit normative authority counts as such because it is claimed by a powerful few, we are pushed firmly in the direction of a reckoning with the normative authority of all. Of course, once this reckoning has begun, it is natural to diagnose domination in broadly Kantian terms as the absence of institutions securing respect for our autonomy. (See Bohman 2004 for a similar approach applied to international relations.)

Norm-dependent or moralized theories identify domination with some varieties of unrestrained asymmetric power and not others, whether it be power to dictate the norms of a social relationship, to establish legitimizing narratives, to alter the shape of our supposed rights and duties, to close us off from the space of reasons, to violate our basic interests, or to do us wrong. This makes them more vulnerable to the possibility that domination can take some form not captured by any of these specific powers. Lovett worries that moralized or norm-dependent theories tend toward a kind of historical or cultural myopia, seeing domination only in whatever “forms of social power happen to be the predominant instruments of domination” here and now or in time gone by (2010: 92). He recommends we see some of the powers highlighted by moralized or norm-dependent theories as varieties of domination, but remain alert to other forms it might assume. Of course, devotees of moralization or norm-dependency may respond that the leading non-moralized/norm-independent contenders see domination where there is none, fail to see its specific threat, or cry “domination” where some other social evil is really the problem.

5. Applications

Because power asymmetries persist in other contexts outside the traditionally political, the idea of domination has been marshaled beyond political philosophy in “applied ethics” and political theory—even, recently, in philosophical theology (See Alimi 2025). Opposition to domination has ecumenical appeal. Few deny that the paradigms are examples of injustice; so, to show that some power structure or use of power resembles these paradigms goes a long way toward motivating a verdict against them. Awareness of domination also draws our attention to the ways moral wrong can be manifest outside the limits of individual actions. Aside from questions about which individual actions are wrong, other questions become important. Who is empowered to act in what ways? How are potential victims empowered to resist? Who is vulnerable even if not actually victimized? However benevolent or malign, who makes the rules? Who obeys or refuses to obey, and what does their compliance (or refusal) cost them? How do the actions of those with more power construct the space where the less powerful or the powerless must act?

Medical care (or the failure to provide it) is rife with potential for domination. The sick are vulnerable to those who control what they need to get well (O’Shea 2017, 2018). The disabled choose and act in a world constructed almost entirely for the benefit of and controlled by others (De Wispelaere & Casassas 2014). Workers often have little say in the conditions or culture of their workplaces (Gourevitch 2011; Breen 2015; Anderson 2017). Migrant and immigrant populations often exist in political limbo where they are deeply vulnerable to exploitation and have no legal standing to contest their treatment (Honohan 2014; Costa 2016; Sager 2017). The consumption habits of wealthy nations shape a global environment in which all humans now and for the foreseeable future will make their choices (Bohman 2011; Nolt 2011; Smith 2012; Smith 2013; Katz 2017). The Internet as a digital space of equality and freedom is now a bygone dream of a halcyon age. Hoeksema (2023) and Oldenbourg (2024) adopt and adapt conceptions of domination to theorize this loss.

That workers often have little say in the conditions or culture of their workplaces (Anderson 2017) is obvious. Power relations under contemporary capitalism continues to be one of the most active areas of the current investigation both of what domination is and how to oppose it. In this way, neorepublican-inflected theory carries on the preoccupations of earlier socialist republicans (Gourevitch 2011, Breen 2015, Gilabert 2023, Jenkins 2022, Bryan 2023, Herranz 2024). This has birthed important developments of the relation between domination and other political evils like exploitation (Vrousalis 2023).

Most deployment of anti-domination arguments applies neorepublican theories of domination, but there are important exceptions. In addition to the departures from neorepublican accounts noted above in Friedman’s and Kittay’s work on caregivers and families, other attempts to use domination beyond the traditionally political have yielded revisionary results. For example, Tom O’Shea worries that the standard neorepublican focus on choice interference, and the worsening of an agent’s choice situation, leaves us ill-equipped to see the possibility for “assistive arbitrary power” in medical care. In these cases, the sick may be vulnerable to domination not because someone acts intentionally to interfere with their choices—e.g., by raising the price of a drug beyond what they can afford—but by failing to provide a benefit, as when no one will provide transportation to someone with impaired mobility. Bernd Hoeksema (2023) argues that understanding domination in digital space pushes us toward structural as opposed to agential and individualistic conceptions. In a more dramatic departure, Corey Katz (2017) argues that the tendency of mainstream neorepublicanism to ground domination in social relatedness and the possibility for choice interference makes it unfit to diagnose the domination of those yet to be born (2017). If we want to think of intergenerational injustice as a variety of domination, Katz insists, we must shift to an outcome-based conception that focuses on unjust harm done to future generations, who are unable to resist that harm.

6. Conclusion

Nothing is less surprising than persistent disagreement in philosophy, but the persistence of disagreement about domination is connected to an interesting question about where the discussion should go from here: What do we want a theory of domination to do? Is our theory of domination supposed to tell us when people are free and when they are not? To specify the requirements of truly egalitarian social relations? Do we want our theory of domination to give us insight into the nature of social injustice? To diagnose political misrule? To motivate a theory of democracy? To describe the underclass in late capitalist societies? To capture the complaint of racial minorities in oppressive racialized hierarchies? All of the above? All theories of domination are not equally suited to each of these tasks; as a consequence, the appeal of individual theories may differ according to which we find most pressing.

A related question, at present under-explored in the literature, is how domination does or does not relate to other concepts often used to describe power-related injustices: for example, oppression and subjugation. Young (1990 [2011]) distinguishes between domination and oppression, identifying the former with asymmetric power over action and the contexts of action, and the latter with the more diffuse and sometimes unconscious shaping of institutions in ways that deny some social groups the capacity to understand and express themselves except from the perspective of the privileged. Unfortunately, few have followed her in working out a similar division of labor between these concepts. (For an interesting exception, see Bellamy 2007: 151–152.) More common is the neorepublican assumption that concern for injustices like oppression can be folded into concern for domination (Pettit 1997: 80; Lovett 2022). Just as all theories of domination are not equally suited to every task we might put them to, it may be that attention to domination itself should be supplemented by attention to other varieties of injustice. If nothing else, recent work on domination has dramatically sharpened our understanding of such injustice, even if all its varieties cannot usefully be diagnosed as manifestations of this single ill.

In conclusion, the attempt to theorize power and domination without recourse to debates primarily conducted among continental theorists risks redundancy. We noted at the beginning of this essay how the analytic and continental traditions are nearer in the domination literature than in many areas of philosophy. Increasingly, this nearness is achieving actual interconnection. This is salutary.

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Acknowledgments

Many thanks to the participants in The Philosophical Underclass. Without your help, it would have been very much more difficult to gather the literature I needed to write this.